Guidelines for Contributors

Contributors should feel free to develop their reviews as they think best, within the following broad constraints:

  1. The review should provide an account of the book as a whole, not just of one part or aspect. We also suggest that reviews begin with a brief paragraph giving any overall characterization of the book, so that readers can tell quickly if they are interested in reading the entire review.
  2. The review should offer an evaluation of at least some key aspects of the book and not merely provide a summary. It is also important to give reasons for any evaluations, particularly negative ones.
  3. Reviews should typically fall within the range of 1500-2500 words. Reviewers who think a book requires longer or shorter treatment should check with the editors.
  4. A primary goal of NDPR is to provide timely reviews of new books. Therefore, a review is due no later than three months after the reviewer receives the book. Please submit the review as an email attachment. (If your word processing program is Word Perfect for a PC, please attach the review as an RTF file.)
  5. Please begin the review with a bibliographical entry for the book that follows the following format: author (or editor), title, publisher, date, number of pages, price (paperback if available, otherwise hardback), ISBN. Example:
    Henry Allison, Kant's Theory of Taste: a Reading of the Critique of Aesthetic Judgment, Cambridge University Press, 2001, 440pp., $24.95 (pbk), ISBN 0521795346.
  6. Below the bibliographical entry, give your name and institutional affiliation as you want them to appear.