Is to understand to forgive? This is the central question of Pedro Alexis Tabensky's collection of essays, Judging and Understanding: Essays on Free Will, Narrative, Meaning and the Ethical Limits of Condemnation. One should not be misled by the apparent simplicity of the question. As the collection admirably demonstrates, the question can be approached from numerous angles, and can be given various distinct and subtle answers. Many of the essays use Bernard Schlink's novel, The Reader, as a means of exploring the central issues. The novel purportedly demonstrates through its protagonist (Michael) the potential tension between understanding someone who has committed serious wrongdoing (his former lover, Hanna) and morally judging or condemning her. Unbeknownst to Michael, the older Hanna had been involved in terrible Nazi war crimes. But parts of her story (also previously unknown to him) seem to place these deeds in a context in which one could feel some amount of sympathy for why she performed them. Is it possible for Michael to morally condemn Hanna once he has come to understand the circumstances which led her to perform her terrible deeds? Does his understanding of her stand in tension with his ability to judge her? Some authors consider the notion that like Hanna, all agents have a backstory, a narrative with the potential to mitigate wrongdoing. Another view taken up is that condemnation is never appropriate at all, regardless of the details of one's backstory. Yet others argue that there is no tension between judging and understanding -- understanding merely provides a better means for judging appropriately. The collection also features discussion of certain descriptive claims about the judging/understanding tension, as well as discussion of the relevance of free will, the appropriateness of retributive punishment, and the distinction between first-personal and third-personal moral judgment. These are just some of the many issues considered in this engaging collection. Overall, the collection is interesting and provocative.
Tabensky provides a brief introduction to the whole collection, as well as one-page (or shorter) introductions to each essay. Although the essays are difficult to categorize (as Tabensky readily admits), they are divided into three sections.
The first section is Narrative, Explanation and Forgiveness: The Limits of Condemnation. This section explores and sets up several of the central issues. It begins with Martha Nussbaum's 'Equity and Mercy,' in which Nussbaum contrasts strict justice (dike), with a kind of justice based on the related concepts of equity and mercy (linked under one Greek term, epieikeia, later translated into Latin by Seneca as 'clementia'). She argues in favor of the Senecan ideal of a merciful justice which considers the narrative of the perpetrator and all the particularities of the case, and which then reacts with mildness and sympathy, rather than with strict proportionality. The second essay, by Ward E. Jones, engages in a descriptive project, arguing that we do in fact judge less harshly upon gaining a better understanding of a wrongdoing. But he also demonstrates that not just any sort of explanation will count as giving us this better understanding (he cites Martha Nussbaum and Raymond Gaita as both giving good explanatory schemes). In their respective essays, Brian Penrose and Marc Fellman each argue that there is a tension between judging and understanding, and that taking up the viewpoint of the agent does and should lead to less harsh judgement. Penrose focuses on understanding as an attitudinal state rather than as something that we do. This state diminishes our (Strawsonian) 'reactive attitude' of judging, but in a way distinct from the kinds of pleas discussed by Strawson (such as excuses and justifications, on the one hand, and doubts about the perpetrator's capacity for agency, on the other). Fellman focuses on a parallel between the tension of judging and understanding and the tension between moral enormity and moral complexity. He also argues that responsibility does not just center on ascriptions of praise and blame, but incorporates a 'weave' of various threads. Both authors claim that understanding, while in tension with judging, is not the same as condoning wrong action. In her contribution, Samantha Vice argues that there is an asymmetry between the effects of understanding another and of understanding oneself. Mercy is (and ought to be) the result of understanding another, but because mercy requires an objective stance, the same cannot hold of understanding oneself. To take an objective stance towards oneself would be to take oneself out of the realm of agency.
In general, this part of the collection is helpful. A number of distinctions are drawn here which provide orienting insights and which illustrate the multifaceted nature of the problem. Nussbaum distinguishes between kinds of justice, Jones between kinds of explanations, Vice between first-personal and third-personal judgments, Penrose between understanding as an action and as a state (as well as between kinds of pleas), and Fellman between differing accounts of responsibility. But there is one potential weakness of this first grouping. Among these contributions, there are varying levels of sensitivity to the following point: there are many cases in which understanding provides little grounds for mercy or a lessening of condemnation (e.g., if one comes to understand the agent as privileged, motivated entirely by greed, etc.). Of the authors in this section, Jones gives this issue the most explicit and satisfying treatment, arguing that an explanation in terms of an agent's reasons and motives will not lessen judgment if it is an explanation of the agent and his actions as intentionally malicious (i.e., motivated by malicious desires). But other authors would do well to follow his lead. Again, several authors claim that coming to see things from the point of view of the perpetrator will (and should) incline us towards mercy or a lessening of judgment -- but without condoning the wrong action. The main idea seems to be that an understanding of the agent's circumstances makes us feel less confident that we would not have done the same thing (in those circumstances), due to the weakness of human nature when faced with obstacles. But the assumption tends to be that wrongdoing is usually (if not always) the result of such obstacles. This seems false (as authors in later sections point out). In some such cases of egregious wrongdoing, the only way to come to a merciful judgement would be to put ourselves into the perspective of the wrongdoers to such an extent that our own moral sensibilities would become as warped as theirs. But in that case, the most likely tendency would be to condone (against what these authors want to claim). A greater sensitivity to cases in which understanding may not mitigate would be helpful in responding to this sort of issue.
The second section of the collection is called Free Will, Determinism and Moral Responsibility: Challenging Retributive Judgement. As is obvious from the title, the essays in this section discuss the relevance or irrelevance of free will and determinism to our judging practices. In his contribution, Tabensky argues that the narrative structure of our lives calls for doing away with retributive practices altogether (as opposed to Nussbaum, who calls for merciful practices). He also argues (contra Nussbaum) that if lives are narratives, the particularities do not matter as much as the general fact that human agents cannot be the causa sui of their actions. Chandra Kumar disagrees. He argues for a pragmatic (rather than metaphysical) take on issues of responsibility and claims that causes (of action) do not always lessen responsibility. He argues that understanding can sometimes lead to harsher judgement (as discussed above), typically when the perpetrator is in a position of political power and privilege. Kai Nielsen appears to agree with much of what Kumar has to say, but also argues that the 'social and genetic roulette' involved in our lives should lead us to see our responsibility practices as undertaken for consequentialist reasons only. In his contribution, Jonathan McKeown-Green also argues in favor of pragmatic grounds for our responsibility practices, but does so by attempting to undermine what he calls 'executive control' theories. These are theories which claim that culpability rests on whether the agent's action was truly his own in some sense. Instead, McKeown-Green suggests that attributions of responsibility really rest on the explanatory salience of citing the agent as the cause (he analogizes to cases in which we attribute responsibility to objects, such as thermostats).
All of the authors in this section appear to be compatibilists about responsibility and determinism, except Tabensky. What is potentially confusing, however, is that Tabensky calls himself a compatibilist, by which he means that determinism does not rule out free will, even though determinism rules out responsibility. (Those familiar with current free will literature will notice that this is an interesting reversal of sorts, of what John Fischer calls 'semicompatibilism', whereby determinism rules out freedom to do otherwise, but does not rule out responsibility. In terms of responsibility Tabensky is, to my mind, more of a 'hard incompatibilist' and argues -- in a manner similar to Derk Pereboom’s -- that getting rid of retributive attitudes need not worry us.) It is also potentially confusing that Tabensky appears to characterize 'compatibilism' as including a commitment to the truth of determinism (though he says it need not involve any strong commitment to a particular kind of determinism). This is in contrast to many other current day free will theorists who take compatibilism to be a thesis that by itself remains silent on whether determinism is in fact true. But because he defines his terms, the careful reader ought to avoid confusion. Though the authors in this section are not focused primarily on metaphysics (some even deriding its usefulness in this context), readers familiar with current libertarian accounts of free will may find themselves frustrated at the cursory and sometimes inaccurate treatment of such views. In general, libertarian freedom is here characterized as contra-causal, transcendent, and anti-naturalistic. But most current day libertarians go to great lengths to accommodate the fact that human agents are part of the natural order, and many libertarians utilize the notion of probabilistic causation. Because of this, the discussions in this section occasionally feel as if we are rehashing the free will debate of days gone by. But this old debate is not the main focus of this section, so the essays still yield material that should be of interest even to those well versed in the most current free will literature. For example, McKeown-Green's claims about executive control and explanatory salience are illuminating (even if one disagrees with his conclusions). And the other authors make helpful and interesting points in response to fellow contributors: Tabensky argues against Nussbaum, Kumar argues against Tabensky, and Nielsen responds to several other authors in two addenda to his own piece.
The third and final section of the collection is called The Ethical Function of Condemnation. The essays here tend to find a more favorable role for condemnation, provided that it is properly understood and applied. Thaddeus Metz argues that understanding is not in tension with condemnation, but rather allows for appropriate judgement. Utilizing the Kantian notion of respect for persons, he argues that retribution ought to be proportional to wrongdoing. In their contribution, Peta Bowden and Emma Rooksby contend that condemnation is an essential part of our 'socio-ethical' roles and so should not be abandoned. They argue that context-sensitivity is vital to making appropriate judgements. Andrew Gleeson comes to similar conclusions, arguing for a middle ground between the "liberals" who exonerate everyone (because mitigating circumstances always exist) and the "moralists" who advocate withholding the right to respect from those who commit the most evil acts. The final piece, by Richard Weisberg, is a literary analysis of The Reader, rather than an argument regarding some aspect of the general issue of understanding versus judging. Weisberg claims that the novel is not about whether judging is in tension with understanding, because Hanna is condemned from the start. Instead, the novel is about the main character, Michael, and his struggle to come to terms with the atrocities committed by the previous generation, members of which have played an important role in his life.
There is much of interest in this last section as well. Metz argues that certain non-retributive practices support the idea that we are justified in imposing burdens on others because of what they have done. Accordingly, we have little ground for saying that our retributive practices are unjustified. Gleeson makes the important point that there are two dangerous extremes: treating evil-doers as vermin to be exterminated and humanizing them to the point that all deeds are morally equivalent. (For my own part, I might have liked to see discussion of whether treating evil-doers as subhuman is problematic for another reason: i.e., that it takes such agents to be incapable of human good and thus as potentially out of the realm of human moral responsibility.) Weisberg's short piece is a welcome closing to the collection. Initially, it might seem out of place, since it analyzes the novel as focusing on an issue distinct from the central question. But really it adds a new layer of complexity to the issue by turning our sympathies toward the other party -- the one who is faced with trying to judge and trying to understand. This sympathy seems well-founded and is echoed by Bowden and Rooksby, who note the morally painful and exhausting task of making appropriate moral judgements. Weisberg's piece goes even beyond this, though, in questioning how we are able to understand the one trying to understand -- in this case, Michael, and his counterpart, Schlink, the novelist.
In sum, Tabensky has provided us with a collection that encourages us to reflect deeply upon our moral engagement with others (and ourselves). It utilizes philosophical and literary resources to draw the reader into its rich dialectic, and does so with insight and imagination .