Analytic philosophy of literature and deconstructionist thought make strange bedfellows, but they join in making matters difficult for the literary humanist. The analytic philosopher, using investigations regarding truth, reference, meaning, knowledge, justification, and the like will press toward a conclusion that literary fiction cannot be about the world and cannot give us knowledge of it. From quite different considerations, in emphasizing textuality and in supposedly undermining notions of representation and truth, the postmodern thinker concludes that literary fictions do not gain their significance through the ways they link up with a non-textual world beyond them. In contrast, the literary humanist wishes to argue that literature involves a cognitive engagement with the world, in ways that matter to our living out our lives as humans. John Gibson wants to give a strong defense of that claim, while at the same time granting considerable strength to the views of the humanist's opponents.
Gibson is a philosopher of admirable clarity whose discussions contrast favorably with so much work in literary and cultural studies that seems to have little sense of what an argument is. At each point in his presentation, the reader knows just what move is being made in the debate. Gibson requires of his account that it satisfy two conditions at once. First, it should demonstrate that fiction has worldly import and illuminates reality, in a robust sense. Second, it should allow that the fictive stance we take toward literature is different in kind from the kind of stances we take toward linguistic sequences that purport to be assertions about how matters stand in the world. That is, the admirable effect produced by literature must be internal to what makes it function as the special kind of thing it is. One approach might be to challenge the analytic philosopher on what is meant by knowledge; perhaps there are models of what it is to grasp what the world is like that will apply better to fiction than the models now typically imported from philosophy. Gibson, while allowing that possibility, importantly decides to pursue a different strategy. He will grant the skeptic his claim that if fiction is somehow to be about the world, it will not be so in a manner that can be explained through the idea of knowledge. But then how can one prevent the text from becoming an isolationist realm, without tie lines to reality?
Gibson's move is to ask what elements might enter into our knowledge, as a condition for it or a fulfillment of it, that will not count, in themselves, as a knowing of things. He argues, first, that literature offers something like criteria for making sense of the world, rather than pieces of knowledge. Wittgenstein is the model here. The meter bar in Paris is a standard for being a meter, but to point to its being a meter is not to make a testable assertion about the world. In a similar way, says Gibson, the play Othello offers a standard for making judgments about racism, though it does not make any assertions about that topic. I am not convinced by this comparison. We can still ask questions about racism in Shakespeare's play that we could not ask if it were providing a standard or criterion for judging, in the manner of the meter bar. What elements does modern American racism, or perhaps racism of another historical period, display such that the racism expressed in Othello is an inadequate model for it? Are there other historical or literary cases of racism that do a better job of bringing out its core features than does that expressed by Shakespeare's characters?
Gibson's second strategy is to make use of Stanley Cavell's distinction between knowledge and acknowledgment, where to acknowledge that another person is in pain will produce a richer set of responses than simply to know that the other is in pain. The idea is to put truth and knowledge on one side of the line, as the sort of things specified by the analytic philosopher, and then to counterpose to these a much richer set of responses that will not count as a form of knowing the world, but will be necessary if we are to make sense of how knowledge fits into a larger pattern of life, and if we are to do something with it. These responses, attitudes, and connectings will be what literature makes possible, and while they will not involve making assertions about the world, they will count as world-directed and world-revealing because of how they enrich our cognitive engagement with the world. This manner of cognitive world-directedness is at the very center of Gibson's defense of the literary humanist. He describes it in a number of ways. The form of worldly engagement in question will not offer truths but will concern the ways we invest human reality with meaning and significance. It will bring to light the consequences, and the import, of aspects of reality. It relates our beliefs to forms of human activity and to social practices that extend across time. It does not give us a new bit of knowledge but makes us alive to the value and significance of what we know. It is constitutive of the take we have on the world rather than a mimetic duplication of reality. It allows us to fit what we know into the weave of life, into the fabric of our embodied social existence.
I am not sure that Gibson's talk of the weave of life is specific enough to separate out a special form of meaning-bestowal from what we do in our most ordinary activities as knowers. What could be left over on the other side that could be contrasted with the sort of intelligent making sense of the world that he describes? Suppose we consider what could count as quite bare propositional knowledge: the capacity to respond with true assertions when asked to name U. S. state capitals and world capitals. Simply producing an utterance, say, "Paris is the capital of France," will not count as any kind of knowledge at all, or even as any assertion at all, unless one can understand that statement in the context of very complicated human political and social practices, such that value and significance can be given to certain locations and activities, and such that various human forms of identification and differentiation can affect our investment of reality with meaning and significance. But that kind of meaning-relevant activity is precisely what is at the heart of Gibson's account of a kind of cognitive engagement other than knowing, the very kind that literature contributes to. I am not disagreeing with his overall story of our sense-making practices and of their importance for literature. What he has really shown, in describing them, is the impoverishment of the picture offered by the analytic philosopher of literature as to how we are engaged with the world as sophisticated trackers of its features, and as participants in a rich practice of making sense of things. The idea of knowledge derived from analytic philosophy has been too much shaped by a problematic of epistemic insecurity, so that a very special kind of cognitive achievement, where truths have been ordered in a certain justificatory way, is the model. In order that he not trespass on the space of cognitive engagement that Gibson has ceded to the analytic philosopher of language, he is forced into intellectual contortions, such as appealing to Wittgenstein's notion of criteria where that notion is a poor fit.
A different model is provided by the very common experience of those who work in artificial intelligence, regarding what is often called the frame problem. While one can construct a "thinking" machine that makes very complicated logical inferences, it is devilishly hard to design one that can figure out what information is relevant to a situation and what is not. Apparently simple activities, even knowing how to order a hamburger, are caught up in intricate patterns of relevance. The machine's performance would not even count as something so basic as making an assertion unless it was at home in such larger fields of relevance, of significance and import. The model of cognitive engagement we should bring to the study of literature is not that of lining up assertions, but that of being sophisticated pattern-recognizers able to map and track significant features of the physical and social worlds. Then the kinds of things Gibson describes would fit naturally into our ordinary notion of cognition, instead of requiring a special space carved out against the sphere of knowledge proper. It may well be true that there are ways we invest objects with meaning and import that will not be included in this kind of ordinary cognition, but then Gibson must specify these more clearly than the notion of a "weave of life" has done. Even in comprehending something as a bed or a chair, I am fitting it into the weave of human life. His mention of jealousy and racism in Othello, and of love in popular songs, suggests, what is correct, that as knowers of the world we are constantly enriching the nets of association and relevance in which our concepts are placed, and are making them more precise, deeper, and more subtly attuned to the complexity of the world. But that would seem to call for a special and extra account of our cognitive engagement with reality only if we began with the analytic philosopher's impoverished account of what it is to grasp what the world is like. (A Davidsonian theory of meaning is one such example of impoverishment.)
Gibson believes that for the literary humanist to succeed, it must be that the cognitive and world-directed aspect of literature is a function of how it works as literature. Our cognitive benefit is due, he says, to our directly attending to the world created by the text. Its way of bringing out the significance of matters, through connecting them to the social practices of a human life, has enough in common with the weave of cultural life in general that in attending to the fictional world, one is learning as well how to maneuver about in our own. If there is such a strong commonality, the question arises of just how well Gibson's account shows that our cognitive benefit as readers comes from the character of the literary as such. He has indeed shown that taking a fictive stance toward the world of a text does not interfere with its having cognitive import in our relations to the real world. But he does not appeal further to specific literary features. To take just one example: A writer such as Melville uses powerful images and metaphors to help establish in the reader's brain a rich system of interconnections, only partly conscious. This resonant system allows us as readers to forge neural connections that make available a large, perhaps vague, pattern of information that we could never express propositionally. Gibson does not refer to specifically literary forms of cognitive work such as that, but merely to the way that a fictive stance is consistent with a cognitive engagement with reality. Gibson is also insistent that his defense of the humanist will not involve a representational or mimetic account of literature. But it appears that what makes good literature stand out for him is the way it brings into view the fabric of life that is shared by the fictional and the real worlds. Then good literature is in an important sense mimetic. It does not produce assertions that are made true by states of affairs in the world, but it does try to present the weave of life, the ways that things are significant for us, with considerable accuracy. Books fail when their characters do not ring true, when their narratives are unconvincing, when the patterns of life supposedly revealed seem thin, artificial, and imposed.
Gibson contributes to other literary debates. He argues against the "make-believe" theory of literature, the idea that in reading literature, one temporarily takes to be true things that one knows are not. The model is the case of a child making believe that a stick is a gun he is shooting at enemy soldiers. Gibson weakens his argument by turning his opponent into an unlikely generalist who says that this attitude of making-believe applies to all the statements of the text, even those, for example, that deal with geographical or historical situations that are accurately presented. Such a generalist view would not follow from the comparison with child's play: in standing behind a tree to shoot the stick at an enemy, the child is not making believe there is a tree there. (Gibson admits something like this in a footnote but does not change his argument to face the difficulty.) He considers as well the issue of panfictionalism: the claim, often by post-structuralists, that every text is a fiction, even a newspaper report, so that the distinction breaks down between fictional and non-fictional texts. That claim depends, I believe, on a sophomoric blurring of the meaning of 'fiction' and it ought to be confronted directly. Gibson does not take this route. As he did with the issue of knowledge, he grants the opponent his position and then shows that, even in granting it, the literary humanist is not defeated. For even if panfictionalism is true, there will still be a difference between the kind of fictive stance we take toward literary texts and the kind of stance we take toward the other "fiction" that we call reality. Gibson also argues, successfully, against seeing literary fiction as like a thought experiment in science; there is not the practice, in the former case, of drawing inferences from a hypothesis. A better model that Gibson might have used, but did not, is that of a simulation, for example, the flight simulator used by a military trainer to train jet fighter pilots. One may, for political reasons, assign to enemy fighters, in this simulation, the markings of a fictitious country. But learning in that fictional world has very, very much to do with gaining knowledge about how to maneuver about in the real one.
This is a book to be recommended for its clarity, its precision of argument, its laying out of a strong case for the literary humanist position, and its clear presentation of, and confrontation with, a range of opposing views that currently are popular within the field of philosophy of literature. Again, I believe Gibson has ceded too much to the analytic philosopher of language in terms of defining what our cognitive engagement with the world might be. A more interesting alliance would be with cognitive science. The cognitive scientist may indeed need the literary humanist to make sense of some of the best examples we have of the brain's extraordinary ability to see new patterns across wide fields and diverse forms of experience: literary texts.