Introspection and Consciousness

Although contemporary philosophers generally reject the (allegedly) Cartesian view that the mind is perfectly known to itself, the idea that each of us has a special mode of access to his or her own mind remains stubbornly attractive. Whether the story of this attraction is that of a doomed obsession from which self-respecting philosophers must break free, or of a comedy of errors that is bound to end in a happy reconciliation -- this depends on who gets to tell the tale. Judging simply by the number of anthologies on self-knowledge that have appeared in the last two decades, however, the philosophical interest in this turbulent topic is considerable.[1]

The volume under review is distinguished from other recent collections by its effort to bring together philosophers approaching the mind's self-awareness from two different angles: on the one hand, from the standpoint of an interest in our (seeming) capacity to know our own present mental states in a special way in which others cannot know them, and on the other hand, from the standpoint of an interest in the nature of consciousness, and in particular of the specifically "phenomenal" dimension of consciousness that has seemed to many recent philosophers to be the most distinctive and puzzling feature of our mental lives. Both topics are evidently connected with the idea that, for some central range of mental state types, the obtaining of such states normally involves or gives rise to some modification in the subject's awareness of how things are with her. Using "introspection" to name "the distinctive way in which we come to know about ourselves and, in particular, our own conscious mental states, processes, and events" (p. 3), the editors of the present volume propose that a theory of introspection should clarify the connection between these two topics, self-knowledge and consciousness. Yet, they observe, "the relationship between consciousness and self-knowledge has been curiously neglected and remains poorly understood" (p. 3).

With this -- to my mind, very reasonable -- motivation, the editors bring together fifteen essays on the nature of introspection and its relation to consciousness, together with a lucid and substantial introduction offering an overview of questions a theory of introspection might address and of the several answers given by the contributors. All but one of the essays are first published here -- the exception is a piece by Sydney Shoemaker (2009) updating and defending his influential "constitutivist" account of self-knowledge. While not all of the contributions focus squarely on the relation between introspection and consciousness, the volume is remarkably coherent, with the essays taking up a variety of positions on several main questions, and the authors showing a commendable awareness of what other contributors are up to.

There is far more material here than can be covered in a review, so with apologies to those whose work I won't describe, I will choose a few themes that particularly gripped me and discuss some essays that bear on them. I hope this selective survey gives some sense of the richness of the volume as a whole.

A Distinctive Way of Knowing?

To define introspection as our distinctive way of knowing our own present mental states is to presuppose that there is a distinctive way in which we know (at least certain of) these states. This "Difference Thesis" -- to use the editors' appropriately blank term -- immediately raises several questions. First, is it true? Second, if it is true, in what respects is introspection distinctive? Third, which kinds of mental states are knowable in this special way?

Although most contributors to the present volume accept some form of the Difference Thesis, there is some dissent even on this basic point. The volume begins with a provocative essay by Eric Schwitzgebel challenging the idea that there is some single process that grounds our judgments about our own present mental states. Schwitzgebel makes his case primarily by giving descriptions of cases like the following:

I think about what, if anything, I am emotionally experiencing right now. I notice, first, that my lips are pursed, and I relax them; I notice some tension in my chest . . . Some kind of negative affect is present -- perhaps I'm tense about writing this essay? A visual image of a blank word-processing screen has come before my mind. But I had been looking forward all day to finally having a chance to write! As I think about the little remaining time to write the essay, I seem to become more unsettled . . . Being tense about the deadline doesn't seem like the only thing that is going on with me emotionally right now -- but what more there is I can't quite put a finger on. I find myself listening to the freeway traffic in the distance, calming myself a bit with eyes closed and head in hands. (pp. 35-6)

This is vividly described, and Schwitzgebel argues persuasively that the conclusion one reaches about one's emotional state in such a situation will draw on a variety of kinds of information, and will involve a variety of cognitive processes, including ones that may influence the very state they seek to assess. Schwitzgebel argues that similar points apply to a wide variety of introspective tasks: describing one's present visual experience, characterizing one's auditory imagery, etc. He concludes that if we call the enterprise of trying to answer such questions "introspection", we should think of introspection simply as

the dedication of central cognitive resources, or attention, to the task of arriving at a judgment about one's current, or very recently past, conscious experience, using or attempting to use some capacities that are unique to the first-person case . . . with the aim or intention that one's judgment reflect some relatively direct sensitivity to the target state. (pp. 42-3)

It does not follow from this characterization -- and, Schwitzgebel maintains, it is not plausible -- that introspection is some single, distinctive cognitive process; any given case of introspection may draw on a variety of ways of knowing, and the ways that are relevant may vary from case to case.

Schwitzgebel is less struck than many other contributors, however, by the curious character of some of the (purported) information drawn on in the kinds of introspective processes he describes. Return to his assessment of his emotional state: he first describes what he thinks of, then what he notices, then a visual image that comes "before his mind," then what he has been looking forward to all day, etc. All of these are descriptions of aspects of his mental life, and he reports them, as we all often do, without hesitation or discernable cognitive work of any kind. His ability to report on the progress of his introspective activity, and our ability to recognize the aptness of his descriptions, rely on a presumed familiarity with these aspects of our mental lives. But what is the basis of this familiarity? When we seek to discover the thoughts, observations, imaginings, hopes, and expectations of other persons, we normally look for evidence in their observable behavior (above all, in what they say). Yet in our own case we routinely assert the existence of the very same kinds of states and events without appeal to self-observation (nor, of course, do we listen to what we ourselves say about such matters; rather, it seems that we say what we do on the basis of already available self-knowledge).

It is difficult to say how we know such things about ourselves. Indeed, the very question "How do you know?" normally seems out of place when asked of a person who says he is thinking about a certain topic, or has been looking forward to something all day. And this situation contrasts strikingly with our epistemic situation with respect to other types of contingent states of affairs, including ones pertaining to ourselves. I am not, for instance, just automatically assumed to know the condition of my liver or the contents of my trouser pockets, and if I do profess to know such things, it is generally appropriate to ask "How do you know?" So what grounds the (presumed) special availability of mental states to their subject, and what can we learn about the nature of mind from this availability? That question, or something like it, is a typical starting point for philosophical reflection on self-knowledge, and the observations that prompt it are a crucial part of what gives rise to the idea Schwitzgebel targets: that we have a distinctive way of knowing our own minds. It is not clear to me that Schwitzgebel addresses the real root of this idea, though I do think his rich and realistic cases bring out an artificiality in much philosophical discussion of self-knowledge.

The idea that we have a special way of knowing our own minds is challenged more directly in Fred Dretske's "Awareness and Authority: Skeptical Doubts about Self-Knowledge". Building on earlier work, Dretske argues that although each of us is in a specially good position to know what he or she thinks, feels, and experiences, this does not give us any special basis for knowing that we think, feel, and experience. In this respect, he holds, our situation is comparable to that of a philosopher whose every written word the Philosophical Gazette has decided to publish. In virtue of knowing what he writes, such a philosopher will know something about what (as a matter of fact) the Gazette will publish, but he will not necessarily know that the Gazette will publish it, and if he does know this, he will not know it simply by having authoritative knowledge of what he writes. Likewise, Dretske argues, my authoritative knowledge of what I believe (e.g., that there is someone at the door) does not supply me with knowledge that this is something I believe, for nothing about the proposition I believe here implies that I believe it.

Dretske does not deny that we do know that we have beliefs, thoughts, experiences, etc., but he maintains that we face a challenge in explaining this knowledge, a challenge that is obscured by carelessly formulated claims about our authoritative knowledge of "our own mental states" (leaving it ambiguous whether the authority pertains to what the states concern, or to the obtaining of the states themselves). He ends his stimulating paper with some speculations about how a grasp of the distinction between explanatory and justifying reasons might play a role in grounding our knowledge of our own thoughts, but the principal effect of the paper is to emphasize the challenge of explaining how our non-self-directed awareness in thinking, feeling, and experiencing can be the basis of reflective self-knowledge.

Both Alex Byrne and Daniel Stoljar take up Dretske's challenge directly, and I think some of the papers on the relation between consciousness and introspection can also be read as bearing on Dretske's problem. I will describe some of these responses below, but for now I will simply remark that, although the majority of contributors assume that we do have some distinctive way of knowing of the existence and nature of at least some of our present mental states, there is relatively little discussion of the precise character of this distinctiveness and of the kinds of grounds we have for assuming it. To be sure, the theories of introspection proposed by the various contributors commonly imply views about these topics, but there is comparatively little pre-theoretical work devoted to motivating and clarifying the intuition that introspection is distinctive. This struck me as a point on which more discussion would be fruitful, not least because it would sharpen the terms of the debate between advocates and opponents of the Difference Thesis.

Introspection and Transparency

Although the etymology of the term "introspection" suggests an inward-directed form of perception, the contributors to the present volume generally employ it as a label forwhatever way we have of knowing about our own present mental states, leaving open the nature of this capacity. A variety of views about the nature of introspection are represented: there are theorists who maintain that we know (certain of) our own mental states by a kind of inference (Alex Byrne), by exercising a certain sort of agency (Richard Moran), and simply by virtue of a reliable noninferential competence in discriminating our own mental states (Ernest Sosa). In addition, there are theorists who hold that judgments about one's own mental states are grounded in a specific kind of conscious awareness (Brie Gertler, Terry Horgan, Nicholas Silins, Charles Siewert), as well as "constitutivist" theorists who hold that we know (at least some of) our own mental states, not by any kind of discernable cognitive step, but rather by virtue of a constitutive connection between being in such states and believing, or being justified in believing, that one is in the relevant states (Sydney Shoemaker, Declan Smithies). Some of the most interesting moments in the volume occur when advocates of these approaches work out their different responses to certain common problems: notably, how to explain the so-called "transparency" of various kinds of mental states, how to characterize the relation between phenomenal consciousness and reflective judgment about one's own mental states, and what the character of introspective awareness can teach us about the metaphysics of various kinds of mental states. I will describe a couple of these disputes, beginning with the issue of transparency.

The puzzle of transparency can be introduced by returning to Dretske's question about how we pass from knowledge of what we think, feel, and experience to knowledge that we think, feel, and experience. On the one hand, it seems that we often do make transitions of this sort: I can normally answer the question whether I believe p simply by considering whether p, and similarly I can answer the question whether I want X simply by considering the merits of my having X, and the question whether I see an F simply by considering whether there is an F in front of me. In each case, I seem to determine that I am in a certain mental state simply by considering what the relevant state concerns (viz., some aspect of the world that is, as a matter of fact, the object of that state). In this sense, my answers to questions concerning such mental states are said to be "transparent" to my answers to questions concerning the worldly objects of those states. But though this sort of transparent knowledge of one's own mental states seems undeniable, the justification for it is puzzling. After all, the fact that p certainly does not entail, and does not seem even to provide defeasible support for, the proposition that I believe that p -- and likewise, mutatis mutandis, in the cases of wanting and seeing. How then can we be justified in answering questions about our own psychology by looking to (seemingly) evidentially irrelevant facts about the world?

Alex Byrne has emphasized this problem, and developed a distinctive line of response to it, in a series of papers. In his contribution here, "Knowing What I See", he extends his approach to the case of vision. Byrne's general idea is that transparent self-knowledge can be represented as the result of an inference from world to mind, an inference whose premises need not entail or provide good evidence for its conclusion, but which nevertheless instantiates a rule that reliably leads a subject to true conclusions about his own mental states. In the case of vision, Byrne accepts Dretske's point that what vision presents -- for instance, a hawk -- does not itself indicate that the thing in question is seen. Nevertheless, Byrne argues, if a person takes it that something in his environment, with certain features characteristically available to vision (a certain shape, orientation, movement, color, shading, etc.), is a hawk, and infers that he sees a hawk, he will be instancing a rule that reliably leads to true beliefs, and arguably to knowledge. The general form of the relevant rule is:

SEE: If [ . . . x . . . ]_V and x is an F, believe that you see an F

where "[ . . . x . . . ]_V" is a "v-proposition": a proposition ascribing to x only properties characteristically available to vision (shape, orientation, depth, color, shading, movement, etc.). Note that a subject can accept both propositions in the antecedent of this conditional without presupposing that he sees the thing x that is an F: he need only think that a certain thing in his environment has certain properties -- properties that are in fact characteristically available to vision, though he need not think that they are properties of this kind, much less that they are properties seen by him here and now. SEE is thus a rule by which subjects could reach conclusions about their own visual states "transparently", and Byrne argues forcefully in favor of this explanation of our transparent knowledge of our own seeing, and against various other natural accounts of how we might know that we see.

Byrne's work on transparency has been widely discussed, and a number of contributors to the present volume respond to his position, most focusing on his earlier suggestion (2005) that our capacity for transparent knowledge of our own beliefs can be explained by our reasoning according to the rule:

BEL: If p, believe that you believe that p.

Sydney Shoemaker and Richard Moran both use a comparison with Byrne's approach to highlight motivations for their own accounts of doxastic self-knowledge.

Shoemaker queries whether a person could actually follow Byrne's BEL-rule, given that believing something is not an act. He suggests we might transform BEL into a serviceable rule by reframing it as

BEL*: If p, judge that you believe that p.

But then, Shoemaker objects, the rule would not explain how we can come to have, and be justified in having, standing beliefs about our own beliefs where no such act of judging has occurred. What really needs explaining, Shoemaker holds, is the generally intimate relationship, in a rational subject, between believing that p and believing that one believes that p, and he goes on to argue that this relationship is best explained by the idea that the beliefs of a rational subject are "constitutively self-intimating" in certain circumstances. Specifically, he holds that a subject who is sufficiently rational, who possesses the concept of belief and the first-person concept, and who has an "available" belief that p, will thereby believe that she believes that p, because a standing second-order belief that one believes that p is simply constituted by an available belief that p held by a subject who meets these conditions. (A belief is said to be available if the subject who holds it is poised to assent to its content if the question of its truth arises, to use that content as a premise in reasoning, and to be guided by it in behavior.) Shoemaker goes on to argue that this fact about the constitution of second-order beliefs can explain why such second-order beliefs stand in need of no justification beyond that supplied by the presence of the relevant first-order beliefs themselves. In the process, he restates and comments interestingly on his widely-discussed argument against the possibility of "self-blindness" (which he here calls "the zany argument", in deference to a common reaction to it), and also discusses what forms of self-deception can be admitted if beliefs are constitutively self-intimating in the sense he characterizes.

Moran also objects to Byrne's rule-following account of how we know our own beliefs, but the alternative he defends differs in important ways from Shoemaker's constitutivism. In influential earlier work (Moran 2001), Moran argued that the contrast between having authoritative knowledge of one's own attitudes and not having such knowledge is linked to a contrast between finding the relevant attitudes rationally acceptable and being alienated from them, and that we can account for this linkage only by connecting our authoritative attitudinal knowledge with our agential relation to our attitudes. In his contribution to the present volume, he seeks to clarify the notion of agency that his account invokes and to respond to some doubts his view has provoked. The point of invoking agency here, he suggests, is not to claim that we can form attitudinal states at will, but to emphasize that our subjective relation to these states bears an abstract similarity to our relation to our own voluntary acts. Thus, in the case of belief, Moran holds that

to believe p is to take p to be reasonable, believable, and in more articulate contexts, defensible or justifiable. And although we do not choose our beliefs and do not perform them like actions, this relation to forms of normative commitment is a matter of common form between beliefs and actions: to believe p is to take p to be believable and open to the question 'why believe that?' and to do something is to take the action to be worth doing in some way, and thus to open oneself to the question 'why are you doingthat?' And in both cases the person takes the answer to the normative 'why?' question to be directly relevant to the existence or continuation of the belief or action in question. (pp. 217-8)

Moran maintains that only an account that recognizes the rationally self-determined character of believing can give a satisfying explanation of the transparency of the question whether I believe p to the question whether p. His main objection to Byrne's approach is that even if one could, by following bel, achieve knowledge of one's own beliefs, this would be a merely "attributional" knowledge: one that did not imply endorsement of the belief attributed. But, Moran claims, authoritative self-ascriptions of belief are not merely attributional in this way: they are "delivered in the mode of endorsing the content of the belief" (p. 231). The special advantage of the agency-based account of transparency, he suggests, is that it explains the characteristically ratifying mode of authoritative attitudinal knowledge.

Consciousness and Introspection

A quite different approach to explaining why a person can normally answer the question whether she believes p simply by answering the question whether p is to argue that (1) one answers the question whether p by consciously judging that p, and (2) one's consciously judging that p normally gives one justification for believing that one believes that p. This would be to accord a crucial epistemic role, in explaining our authoritative knowledge of our own beliefs, to a certain kind of conscious episode. The idea would be that our normal justification for beliefs about what we believe depends on a more direct awareness of a specific kind of episode with which beliefs are correlated. And this approach to explaining doxastic self-knowledge suggests a more general strategy for explaining other varieties of introspective knowledge: we might account for such knowledge by appealing to its (more or less direct) connection to specific kinds of conscious states or events, while arguing that the relevant conscious states and events themselves play a special, foundational role in introspective justification. Several contributors pursue versions of this strategy, some focusing on introspective knowledge of belief, others applying the approach to introspective knowledge of our own sensations and perceptual experiences, still others arguing for the application of the approach to introspective knowledge in general.

Nicholas Silins's perspicuously titled "Judgment as a Guide to Belief" develops the proposal about how we know our own beliefs. According to Silins, philosophers discussing the transparency of the question whether I believe p to the question whether p have often failed to characterize the target phenomenon with sufficient care. Formulated carefully, the relevant fact is:

Transparency: If you judge that p, then your judgment that p gives you immediate fallible justification to believe that you believe that p.

On this interpretation of transparency, when a person moves from an answer to the question whether p to an answer to the question whether she believes that p, her basis for the latter answer is not, as some writers suggest, an apparent fact about the world -- that p -- but her having judged that p, where judgment is conceived of as a conscious episode. Silins goes on to argue that conscious judgments do provide us with immediate justification for beliefs about our own beliefs, that this justification is fallible, and that this makes our justification for transparently-formed beliefs about our own beliefs analogous in important respects to our justification for perceptual beliefs formed on the basis of perceptual experience.

Silins's account of how judgment functions as a guide to belief is distinctive in many of its details, but versions of this idea have also been developed by a number of other recent authors, notably Christopher Peacocke (1998) and Declan Smithies (this volume). I cannot discuss their views in detail here, but I will register a question about their general approach. It is not clear to me how a subject's judging that p can give her a non-question-begging justification for believing that she believes that p. I grant that conscious judgments that p are closely (though perhaps not perfectly) correlated with beliefs that p, but why is one's judging that p supposed to be epistemically more basic, or more readily accessible, than one's believing that p? Perhaps the thought is that, since judgments are conscious events, a subject who judges that p will automatically be aware of doing so, whereas since beliefs are non-occurrent states, a subject who believes that p will not necessarily be aware of believing this. But even if we grant that a subject is automatically aware of whatever events occur in her stream of consciousness, it does not seem obvious that she can recognize certain of these events as judgments without being aware of what she believes. After all, not just any event of consciously entertaining the content that p is a case of judging that p. If I entertain the idea of p's being the case noncommittally, I have not thereby expressed conviction in the truth of p, and so presumably I have not judged. But then it is hard to see how I can be aware of judging that p without being aware that a certain event in my consciousness expresses my conviction that p is true. And this, in turn, seems tantamount to saying that I cannot be aware of judging that p without being aware that I believe that p. So my awareness of judging that p does not seem to provide me with an independently available ground for believing that I believe that p. Rather, my awareness of judging that p seems no more epistemically basic than, and just as fallible as, my awareness that I believe that p.

I intend these remarks, not as a conclusive objection, but as a way of putting a question to people attracted by this approach. To me, it does not seem clear what "conscious judgment" is supposed to be such that it might be available to one's awareness while the question of one's belief on the point at issue was held in abeyance. Is it supposed to be like inwardly saying something, or hearing something said? What properties of this supposed conscious event might identify it as a judgment, and specifically as a judgment that expresses one's own point of view on what is the case (not, e.g., the assessment of an alien voice sounding in one's head)? Theorists who argue that judgment might serve as a guide to belief commonly assume that what judgment is should be clear to any conscious rational subject, and indeed, I suppose I am familiar with a kind of episode in my conscious life that might be called "judgment" -- but it is not clear to me that the thing I am familiar with can play the epistemic role required of it by these theorists.

This expression of skepticism about whether conscious judgment can serve as a guide to belief should not be taken to imply any general skepticism about the idea that conscious awareness plays a crucial role in explaining our capacity for introspective knowledge. Several contributors make intriguing cases for versions of this idea. Brie Gertler's "Renewed Acquaintance", for instance, defends what she calls an "acquaintance approach" to introspective knowledge of the phenomenal qualities of experience, one on which a subject is in a position to have privileged knowledge of these qualities in virtue of the fact that she is directly acquainted with the relevant qualities in a broadly Russellian sense. When a person is acquainted in this way with one of her phenomenal states, Gertler suggests, the phenomenal reality of which she is aware "intersects" with her grasp of that reality in a way that enables her to refer to the relevant aspect of reality using an "introspective demonstrative" whose content is wholly determined by how things phenomenally seem to her. Gertler goes on to sketch an account of how such acquaintance can ground introspective knowledge of certain basic kinds of facts about one's own phenomenal states.

Gertler's view is in some respects similar to a view about the epistemology of phenomenal self-knowledge defended by Terry Horgan and Uriah Kriegel (2007), and this view is further developed in Horgan's contribution to the present volume. Horgan proposes that the phenomenal character of experience is, by its very nature, "self-presenting" to the experiencing subject: necessarily, how a given phenomenal state seems to the subject is how it actually is, because its seeming a certain way to the subject is constitutive of its being that way. It follows, Horgan argues, that certain kinds of beliefs about phenomenal character will be "super-reliable", since they will not be liable to error, as most empirical beliefs are, in virtue of a difference between appearance and reality. Nevertheless, such beliefs will not be absolutely infallible, because they will be liable to other kinds of error, for instance, errors of labeling resulting from imperfect conceptual competence. Moreover, Horgan suggests, sheer introspection gives us almost no help in answering other kinds of questions about the phenomenal character of our experience, because these concern matters that cannot be settled simply by exercising basic competence with the relevant phenomenal concepts. This, he holds, is likely to be true of many contentious philosophical questions about the phenomenal character of experience: settling them requires a level of cognitive skill in deploying concepts that exceeds that required for competence with the relevant concepts, and so there is no guarantee that all conceptually competent persons who introspect carefully will reach the same conclusions.

An interesting question that comes up in Horgan's paper, and also in several other pieces on the relation between consciousness and introspective knowledge, is whether a vindication of the idea that (at least some) introspective knowledge is grounded in conscious awareness would constitute a vindication for "inner sense" theories of self-knowledge. The inner sense model of self-knowledge has, over the past few decades, been subjected to forceful criticism, by Shoemaker among others. Some contributors, however, emphasize analogies between the way that the presence of a conscious state justifies an introspective belief and the way a perceptual appearance justifies a perceptual belief. Others, including Horgan and Charles Siewert, emphasize disanalogies deriving from the peculiarly intimate relation in which appearance and reality stand here. I cannot discuss these similarities and differences here, but suffice it to say that one thought-provoking question raised by this volume is whether we should take the plausible idea that our reflective judgments about our own mental states are often grounded in unreflective consciousness of those states to imply that we make such judgments on the basis of something relevantly analogous to a perceptual appearance, or whether this way of theorizing the matter involves a false assimilation of the structure of self-awareness to that of perceptual awareness.

The foregoing discussion touches on only about half of the essays in the volume, and it omits several interesting themes: notably, what introspection can and cannot teach us about the nature of experience, and whether "constitutivist" accounts of self-knowledge are tenable and how they might best be formulated. I hope, however, that even this incomplete overview gives a sense of how much thought-provoking work there is here. This is a fine volume. Anyone who cares about understanding self-knowledge, consciousness, and the relationship between them will want to lay hold of a copy.

REFERENCES

Byrne, Alex. 2005. "Introspection." Philosophical Topics 33: 79-104.

Cassam, Quassim, ed. 1994. Self-Knowledge. Oxford University Press.

Gertler, Brie, ed. 2003. Privileged Access. Ashgate Publishing Company.

Hatzimoysis, Anthony, ed. 2011. Self-Knowledge. Oxford University Press.

Horgan, Terry and Uriah Kriegel. 2007. "Phenomenal Epistemology: What Is Phenomenal Consciousness That We May Know It So Well?" Philosophical Issues 17: 123-44.

Ludlow, Peter and Norah Martin, eds. 1998. Externalism and Self-Knowledge. Cambridge University Press.

Moran, Richard. 2001. Authority and Estrangement. Princeton University Press.

Nuccetelli, Susana, ed. 2003. New Essays on Semantic Externalism and Self-Knowledge. MIT Press.

Peacocke, C. 1998. "Conscious Attitudes, Attention, and Self-Knowledge." In Wright, Smith, and MacDonald 1998.

Shoemaker, Sydney. 2009. "Self-Intimation and Second-Order Belief." Erkenntnis, 71: 35-51.

Wright, Crispin, Barry C. Smith, and Cynthia MacDonald, eds. 1998. Knowing Our Own Minds. Oxford University Press.