Attacks on particular emotions (or emotions in general) as morally negative have a long history, and it is difficult to think of any emotion that has not at some point been the target of such criticisms. Lately, shame and disgust have been two of the primary emotions under assault (Nussbaum, 2004). Julien Deonna, Raffaele Rodogno, and Fabrice Teroni defend the moral value of shame against a growing tide of critics who condemn it as morally irrelevant or morally bad. Unlike many defenses of particular emotions that defend one set of emotions while, or by, denigrating others, they draw the line and offer a defense of shame that does not shift the blame for purported negative moral consequences onto other emotions. While I will call into question a number of their omissions and excesses, I believe that they are largely successful in accomplishing their most general aims, and that the book counts among the finest philosophical, interdisciplinary treatments of emotions in the recent literature.
The book's four parts (1) present the case against shame as a beneficial moral emotion, (2) present their own theory of shame and defend it against the criticisms laid out in Part One, (3) rescue the truths involved in criticisms of shame (such as shame's greater severity and special connection to the self) by showing how these may be accounted for within their own theory, and finally (4) consider shame in the public domain, including legal shaming penalties and the role of shame in reparation and reconciliation. I will focus my attention on the first three parts. The fourth part is certainly a worthy read, but it is in the earlier parts where they present their core views on shame, and it is these I wish to address. I will furthermore narrow my focus to those distinctions, concepts, and arguments that are most relevant to my constructive or critical remarks, setting many others aside for reasons of space.
Part One is devoted to laying out and assessing the arguments for the view that shame is morally problematic, focusing on "Two Dogmas" within the critical literature. The first dogma articulates a "social conception of shame", i.e., that shame is an essentially social emotion, requiring the actual or imagined presence of others in order to occur. This claim leads shame's critics to conclude that shame is morally superficial or irrelevant in its dependence on others' values. The first dogma contains three closely related strands of argument. The first strand holds that shame is always imposed upon us from the outside as a result of others' judgments, regardless of our own values, and that such externally generated judgments are constitutive of shame, rather than merely antecedents of it. The authors label this as the "radical heteronomy" (as contrasted with "autonomy") of shame. This calls the moral status of shame into question for the obvious reason that responding in such a way involves an utter reliance on external values, and as such may lead us into behaviors that are not consistent with self-chosen values and/or autonomous moral agency.
The second strand of the first dogma maintains that shame essentially and solely involves an evaluation of a person's appearance before an audience. Here the danger is not (merely) that we may be influenced by foreign values, but rather that the personal values it involves, such as concern for appearances, reputation, or privacy, are superficial considerations without moral depth. The third strand maintains that shame involves taking a third-person perspective on the self, whether that of particular people, or more abstractly. This can be problematic insofar as it may preclude the possibility of episodes of shame driven by first-person assessments of our values and violations, which the authors assert are possible and, in fact, necessary for shame to occur. A common underlying problem raised by the three strands of the first dogma is that they call into question the autonomy of the agent in experiencing shame.
The second dogma holds that shame is not merely morally neutral or irrelevant, but rather morally bad in itself. The argument for this dogma consists in establishing connections between shame and behavioral or psychological tendencies that are themselves seen as immoral, or as producing immoral behavior. These include shame's alleged connections to anger, anxiety, depression, hiding and withdrawal, lack of empathy, and shirking responsibility, among others. Here shame is often contrasted with guilt, which many see as a morally positive emotion that leads to reparation, empathy, and prosocial other-focus, and is act-based rather than a crushing judgment of the global self.
In Part Two, the authors criticize existing conceptions of how shame relates to the self, in particular the idea that shame is directed on the "global self", and that it is too severe a judgment to play a positive role in moral behavior or self-reform. In order to do this, they draw a distinction between "values" and "norms". While norms are about acts, and are phrased in terms of all-or-nothing deontological prohibitions, values admit of degrees and instantiate or exemplify deeper traits. Hence, violations of values, or instantiating a disvalue, are properties that belong specifically to features of the self, rather than to features of acts. Hence, they maintain that shame is value-based, while guilt is norm-based. In order to clarify the relationship between shame, value and self, they examine a variety of aspects of the self onto which shame might be directed. These prominently include such as things as respect, dignity, integrity, and adherence to our central commitments, the lack of which they take to threaten the personhood or agency of the individual. They conclude that some of these concepts point in the right direction, but that these features of the self are too fundamental or all encompassing to account for cases in which only failures with respect to particular values generate shame while leaving others intact, a possibility the authors argue is necessary in order to account for many clear instances of shame.
In Chapter 4, Deonna, Rodogno, and Teroni develop an account of shame that preserves a number of features that they endorse, without endorsing the critics' explanations of these features. According to the authors, an agent will experience shame if and only if: (1) people come to take a trait or action of hers to exemplify the polar opposite of a self-relevant value; (2) they apprehend this as indicating a distinctive incapacity with respect to the demands of this particular value; (3) this incapacity is distinctive in the sense that it consists in the incapacity to exemplify, even minimally, this value. The first and third conditions offer an explanation of why shame is severe without being all encompassing, while the second indicates how shame concerns self and identity without implicating the entire global self, viz., shame is focused on our general abilities or character as these relate to particular values, rather than particular acts as in guilt.
The key concepts here are those of "polar opposite", "self-relevant", "incapacity", "exemplification", and a "minimal threshold" for upholding a value. The authors argue that the requirement of the "self-relevance" of values precludes criticisms of shame based on its heteronomy, and indeed implies that shame is entirely autonomous. The perceived all-or-nothing, global character of shame is explicated in terms of a subject's threshold for what counts as "minimally exemplifying" a value, below which she cannot be seen as remaining attached to the value. Dipping below such a threshold, they hold, is to exemplify the "polar opposite" of such a value, and such a failing is more severe than simply committing a wrong action. This severity is increased by the fact that the subject experiences an utter "character-based incapacity" to meet the minimal standards for self-relevant values.
While rejecting the strong social conception of shame, the authors do allow for a number of ways in which shame may be said to properly social, while preserving its autonomy and moral relevance. These include cases in which the self-relevant values concerned are reputation or privacy, which are inherently social, and which can be legitimate moral concerns, contra the critics' arguments. Furthermore, they acknowledge that shame can often be triggered by the presence of others who may make our failings salient to ourselves in ways not apparent to us on our own. Finally, they note that shame can be "trivially social" due to the fact we learn in situ.
The authors then turn to defending shame against the second dogma, that shame is morally bad due to its behavioral and psychological effects. With respect to anger, they argue that the empirical literature that purports to uncover these links is properly interpreted as evoking "humiliation", rather than shame proper, where humiliation is a response to the deliberate and excessive efforts of others to induce shame or humiliation. In such cases, they argue that anger can be a beneficial and moral response reflecting an adherence to values such as fairness or kindness. Once separated in this way, the shame-anger connection largely dissolves into a humiliation-anger connection that can be morally justified. With respect to shame's alleged connection to a lack of empathy, they argue that shame presupposes empathy insofar as our violations of self-relevant values express our care, concern, etc. for others.
The authors' ultimate conclusion is that while shame is indeed morally neutral with respect to the values it conveys, it is nevertheless a norm-neutral moral virtue that underlies the capacity to be fully moral. When episodes of shame reveal a failing, they manifest a "semi-virtue", in that they reflect the subject's attachment to them, while at the same time their awareness of failing to uphold it. Given that shame is concerned with deep-seated features of our character, shame promotes self-reflection on these features, and can lead the agent to undertake self-reform relative to the values that are violated.
A healthy sense of shame leads to "prospective shame" in anticipation of certain immoral acts that can prevent us from committing those acts. In such a case, the authors assert that we can consider shame to be a morally necessary "full-blown virtue". Given its sensitivity to others, the long-term behavioral consequences of shame are not detrimental to interpersonal relationships, but rather manifest our ties to social networks and the values that structure them, and promote renewed or continued integration.
Some of my criticisms can be framed by noting, first, that the book would benefit from a wider cultural perspective. The role that shame plays, and the underlying psychological dynamics behind it, can vary considerably across cultures (Wong and Tsai 2007; Shaver and Edelstein 2007). In many collectivist Asian countries, for example, shame is hyper-cognized as is reflected in an abundance of shame concepts and terms, and shaming practices are common and accepted. The boundaries of the "self" and its autonomy relative to society may also be different. Collectivist cultures have a stronger emphasis on group goods and demands, and the sense of self appears to be broader and more inclusive, shifting the primacy of identity towards the group rather than the individual. Such cultures are also more likely to endorse conformity as a social virtue. While I think that much of the authors' treatment of shame applies equally well to collectivist societies, there are a number of underlying principles they adopt that I feel reflect a bias towards individualistic thinking, especially their conceptions of the self and autonomy.
I will focus on their requirement for autonomy, where I believe that the authors may be overcorrecting in their responses to the two dogmas, adding a strength to their conclusions that is not necessary or warranted. For example, in response to the claim that shame is always heteronomous, they argue that shame is never heteronomous. As noted, they are motivated to argue that shame is never heteronomous in response to the threat that heteronomy implies moral superficiality, irrelevance or at least value-neutrality. However, their overall account of shame as morally relevant but morally neutral with respect to particular values independently possesses the resources to meet these critiques. The fact that shame can be heteronomous is morally neutral with respect to the influences we accept, but could be morally relevant in that it allows us learn new values from others.
Hence, I disagree about the degree to which we are, or should be expected to be, autonomous in our moral choices. None but the most dogmatic of us are certain about our moral judgments or the deep structure of our values. Consequently, moral life is a continual process of checks, balances, and dialogues involving deep sensitivity to and respect for the perspectives, values, etc. of other people or groups. Such humility, sense of shame, and cultivated moral uncertainty is required if we wish to strive towards moral growth. This much Deonna, Rodogno, and Teroni allow, but I believe that such considerations imply that it can be valuable to feel shame for having violated a moral value that we do not entirely understand, and such shifts are typically driven from without. This is essential for learning, since teachers teach not only by pointing to our failures to live up to standards, but also which values to possess in the first place, about which we may have no clue. Hence, the capacity to be taught implies a willingness to open and commit oneself emotionally to the judgments or values of others. Emotions often lead the understanding of values-as-such, which is not (necessarily) to say that the emotion itself generates the value, but rather that the experience of shame leads us to examine ourselves and the values in question, which can precede full understanding of them.
The authors would likely respond that the autonomy of shame can be upheld in such cases by appealing to the higher-order values of the individual in such learning (e.g., respect the opinions of experts). However, the self-relevant values here are quite general, and are only given more fine-grained content by the specific moral decisions, judgments, or values that we accept. Relatedly, it is sometimes reasonable to recognize your own lack of autonomy and not merely under the kind of extreme circumstances "when they take you away". In everyday life, at various scales of importance, we may be truly uncertain about what our own values imply, or how to resolve a conflict among them, or whether we have the necessary knowledge, experience, perspective, or emotional balance to make the correct decision. Or we may be learning a new set of values, and defer to authorities in that domain. Hence, there are times when we can, or even should, accept the values of others and guide our behavior accordingly. Such decisions are, I suggest, morally justifiable instances of heteronomy.
While in conflict with many of the authors' claims, I believe that these ideas might be accommodated in their overall aims and woven onto some loose threads in their arguments that point in this direction. One of these open threads concerns the role of shame in development. At three points in the book (pp. 8, 24, 153), the authors (and even the original thinkers who argue that shame's heteronomy is morally problematic) allow that heteronomous shame may be essential to moral development, but imply that such sensitivity and conformity to others' values is a limited stage, beyond which autonomy is expected of mature moral agents. I would argue, however, that such developmental "openness" remains (and remains potentially morally advantageous) into adulthood. In any case, while they might disagree with the particulars of my account of how heteronomy can serve as a morally beneficial means of learning new values, they must have some account of how this can occur in development. In order to deny a similar openness to adults we would require a clearer account of why, how, and when this heteronomous learning ceases to be morally legitimate and must by replaced autonomy.
A second open strand comes in the authors' discussion of the legitimate senses in which we can feel shame for others (p. 113). According to them, such cases break down into four classes. They take the first two, (i) emotional contagion and (ii) imaginative projection, to be relatively unproblematic, but go on to ask a more complicated question, viz. "Does shame for someone else affect our own identity, defined in terms of self-relevant values?". They also point to two additional classes of shame for others: (iii) association with shameful acts or persons, and we may feel shame for others because (iv) "there are values we adhere to directly, and 'embedded' values we adhere to indirectly, because we love or deeply respect someone else" where shame for others is "a negative apprehension of another's self-conception as reflected in these embedded values" (p. 113). Relatedly, they claim in several places that there is nothing heteronomous in deferring to others, e.g., experts. I am uncertain exactly what "embedded values" means here that is not captured by contagion, imaginative projection, or association. However, the idea of values that are held indirectly in virtue of love, respect, trust, and the like seems to allow that we ourselves may feel shame in response to our violations of such indirectly held values, and that the acceptance or learning of more specific "embedded values" as a result of embedding in either more general self-relevant values, or frames created by morally relevant affects, could provide an account of how heteronomous shame works, and why it can be morally beneficial.
There are a great many other things to praise and criticize in this book. It will prove a valuable read for anyone interested in emotions and their role in morality.
REFERENCES
Edelstein, R. S., & Shaver, P. R. (2007). A cross-cultural examination of lexical studies of self-conscious emotions. The self-conscious emotions: Theory and research, J. L. Tracy, R. W. Robins, & J. P. Tangney (eds.), 194-208. Guilford Press.
Nussbaum, M. C. (2004). Hiding from humanity: Disgust, shame, and the law. Princeton University Press.
Wong, Y., & Tsai, J. (2007). Cultural models of shame and guilt. The self-conscious emotions: Theory and research, J. L. Tracy, R. W. Robins, & J. P. Tangney (eds.), 209-223. Guilford Press.