Kant on Religion within the Boundaries of Mere Reason

Lawrence R. Pasternack's book joins a growing list of recent commentaries, guidebooks, and interpretations that tackle the daunting task of presenting a coherent account of Kant's enduring classic Religion within the Boundaries of Mere Reason (henceforth Religion). It takes a familiar two-part approach. The first part offers strategic interpretive prolegomena that readers need to keep in mind as they approach the interpretation on offer, while the second part turns to an original elucidation of each of Religion's four Books.[1] Pasternack understands Kant to be a theologically affirmative philosopher who, in Religion, is consciously attempting to articulate a type of rational religious faith that aligns with the trajectory and tropes of Martin Luther's theology but remains under the strictures of Kant's own critical philosophy. What distinguishes Pasternack's reading from previous proposals of this kind is his assertion that Kant coherently and compellingly accomplishes this synthesis.

The result of Pasternack's efforts is a semi-Pelagian rendering of Kant on rational religious faith that overcomes some of the inconsistencies certain readers have spied. I say "some" because, in presenting a lucid narrative of the whole of Religion, minimal attention is given to the conundrums.[2] Thus, the fundamental coherence of his position and its resonance with what Kant actually writes is not fully demonstrated; it stands or falls with his readers' knowledge of the text and the secondary literature. This makes the book an able guidebook for those interested in an accessible way into Religion. However, it will likely lead to a bittersweet reception from scholars of Kant. Pasternack's Kant puts on a theologian's cap and proceeds to dismantle the plain-sense meaning of the Bible, replacing it with the vaguely Christian moral narrative outlined in Religion. This moral narrative likewise becomes entangled with the tenets of Kant's rational system of religion as it seeks to articulate a critically credible trajectory for religious belief. In the end, Pasternack's interpretation provides a potent psychological account of how human beings can, through faith in certain moral postulates necessary for achieving the Highest Good, pull up their moral bootstraps and make themselves worthy of divine favor. There are, of course, costs to his putative success that I will enumerate below. However, Pasternack deems these costs to be worth it because they allow Kant to fulfill his philosophical promise in the Critique of Pure Reason to "deny knowledge to make room for faith" (Bxxx).

Turning to the specifics, Pasternack's interpretive prolegomena include three major themes: (1) a careful consideration of Kant's definitions of faith, knowledge and opinion, (2) an explanation of and brief rationale for the nature of Kant's "two experiments" in the Second Preface of Religion and (3) an overview and exegetical treatment of Kant's notion of the Highest Good as it develops through the Critiques and on into Religion. The distinctions between faith, knowledge and opinion serve not only to remind the reader that Kant's philosophy provides epistemic room for faith but also to beckon the reader to consider how this room may be occupied in Religion. These distinctions are now well established in the field and relatively uncontroversial. Pasternack's treatment of the Highest Good adds significantly to the credibility of this procedure. According to Pasternack, "Kant identifies the Highest Good as the object that fulfills pure practical reason's quest, but rather than describing it to be an illusion and cautioning us against affirming it, he instead launches into a defense of it and of the postulates necessary for its realization" (47). Pasternack ably tracks the development of this idea throughout Kant's critical period, pointing out at least four different versions of the argument in the three Critiques and Religion. According to Pasternack, Kant is not groping for arguments but rather developing his philosophical position in readiness for the presentation on rational religious faith that we find in Religion. These two aspects of his prolegomena to interpreting Religion (points 1 and 3 above) are astutely presented and seem to establish sufficient critical justification for Kant's turn to religion at the interface of philosophy and theology. Whether or not the specifics of Pasternack's account of Kant on rational faith and Highest Good supports the specifics of his particular reading of the text is not clear to me. It clearly justifies that Religion has been written but not necessarily what is contained therein.

Pasternack's interpretation of the two experiments in the Second Preface of Religion in chapter two provides most of the interpretive artillery for his interpretation of Religion in the second half of the book (although Pasternack mysteriously applies it as an "Addendum" only to his interpretation of Parts One and Two of Religion). The literature on these two experiments is made up of basically three positions. The first approach is what Nathan Jacobs and I have called the Religion-as-Translation Thesis.[3] It argues that the first experiment of establishing the content of rational religion takes place in the Groundwork of the Metaphysics of Morals (1785) and the Critique of Practical Reason (1788), while Religion itself represents the second experiment of comparing a revealed religion (viz., New Testament Christianity) with it to see whether it is translatable into the same system of rational religion. The second approach is one recently clarified and defended by Steven R. Palmquist.[4] This view suggests that the two experiments are found interspersed throughout all four Books of Religion as Kant moves back and forth between the establishment of rational religion and the testing of revealed religion. Jacobs and I called this approach the Religion-as-Symbol Thesis[5] as it understands Kant's language concerning the human disposition (Gesinnung) and divine prototype (Urbild) not as mere philosophical abstractions (per Reardon and Hare) but rather as symbolic representations of the Adamic Fall and Jesus Christ. Kant in Religion is synthesizing Christianity into rational terms, but these terms have a relevant moral meaning and associated religious experience that also informs the nature of rational religious faith. The third approach is advocated in the interpretation of Firestone and Jacobs. We argue that both experiments are contained within Religion but are divided between Books One, Two and Three (which primarily contain the first experiment and the critical tenets of rational religious faith) and Book Four (which contains the second experiment or the test of New Testament Christianity).[6] Religion, on this reading, is essentially a transcendental assessment of the necessary conditions for the possibility of moral hope that seeks to establish critically the nature of the human moral disposition and the doctrines of rational faith.

Which of these overarching approaches concerning the two experiments one chooses matters a great deal to how the remaining interpretation of Religion unfolds. But Pasternack does not deal with this aspect of his prolegomena in the context of these competing options. He simply sides with the interpretation of Palmquist, suggesting that both experiments are happening in tandem throughout the four Books of Religion and that Kant is obviously adopting material from the Bible (viz., the biblical Adam and Jesus) and abstracting rational religion from this material in the first two Books of Religion. Unlike Palmquist, however, Pasternack's understanding of the experiments makes no attempt to say where one experiment begins and the other ends, which leaves his readers in the dark as to what constitutes the second experiment and what exactly is rational religious faith. Also unlike Palmquist, he does not present a robust notion of symbolism but rather only offers rational abstractions or ideas meant to encourage moral improvement.

A series of closely related problems immediately surfaces on this reading of the two experiments that threatens to sabotage his interpretation before it ever gets off the ground: (1) What are we to do with Kant's claims, in the Prefaces to Religion (6:13) and reaffirmed in his letter to the King of Prussia reprinted at the beginning of his final publication, The Conflict of the Faculties (1798), that interpreting the Bible and making pronouncements about its theological content is a philosophical trespass on the rightful territory of theology and that nowhere in Religion is this trespass committed? (2) What philosophically sufficient reasons exist for why Kant would resort to a serious engagement with Christianity in the first place? And (3) Does the assumption that both experiments are present throughout Religion and the adoption of Christianity as the main object of the second experiment mean that a second translation actually occurs in the text -- namely, the first experiment conforms rational religion into the likeness of Christianity?

Concerning the first point, Pasternack holds that, despite what the Prefaces indicate, Kant regularly interprets the Bible and thereby trespasses on the rightful territory of theology. He determines that Kant is morally lax in his explanation of his religious methodology and essentially two-faced when dealing with those concerned for theological matters and their philosophical counterparts. According to Pasternack, the Prussian government, as theological guardians of the public, rightfully sanctioned Kant, even though Kant, for the sake of truth, is essentially doing the right thing when committing this inconsistency. For Pasternack's Kant, at least in this particular case, the ends justify the means. Many will find this aspect of his interpretation hard to accept based on Kant's strict moral code, commitment to religious sincerity, and attention to detail.

The second and third questions are related and may well end up being the most troubling of all for Pasternack's interpretation, on which there appears to be no philosophically sufficient reason for turning to Christianity. The closest we get to a rationale is that Kant turns to Christianity because it contains more of the pure rational system of religion than any other options at Kant's disposal (224). However, this alone does not provide a sufficient philosophical reason for such a strong philosophical dependence on Christianity. The second experiment, it seems, is already a foregone conclusion on Pasternack's interpretation and what ends up happening, since both experiments are indeed found within Religion, is a kind of double-translation effect. Assuming there are in fact two experiments at work in Pasternack's interpretation, of which I am not at all confident, the first must be the translation of Christianity into rational terms, and the second must be the translation of rational religion into Christian terms. The two experiments seem to develop in reciprocal relationship with one another, so much so that they are mutually interdependent and so interwoven that they are hard (or even impossible) to tell apart. This procedure, of course, stands in fundamental tension with the moral philosophy and the reliability of the ought-implies-can principle. How can morality require the free adoption of the moral law as our highest incentive while rational religion maintains that every human being is evil by nature and therefore fails in their personal employment of freedom? This is but one of the many conundrums that must be dealt with if a given interpretation is to stand the test of time.

As we turn to the main body of Pasternack's interpretation armed with the above interpretive prolegomena, we find that the results are mixed. Pasternack tracks well with Kant in pointing out that he is a moral rigorist in Book One, that is, humans must either be good or evil (not morally neutral or mixed). He then recognizes that Kant requires a universal judgment regarding the moral nature of the human species. Which are we -- good or evil? The very difficult problem is how you get from individual decisions to a universal judgment about all of humanity. Kant struggles mightily with this question, and it is the judgment of most in the Kantian establishment that he needs a rational argument for it to carry the currency necessary to meet the strictures of the critical philosophy. Pasternack's solution to the universality problem is what he calls "comparative universality" (104). We each sin and see others fall into sin. This seems to happen to every one we know and from our first recollections onward. Pasternack finds support for this position in Patrick Frierson's view that Kant promotes a type of "empirical universal judgment." Pasternack's word for this inference is "abduction." He concludes that human persons everywhere inevitably fall into sin in a like manner. Freedom of choice is maintained because every person chooses to fall freely and originally of their own accord.

As a metaphysical and philosophical conclusion, this solution is too quick and hardly satisfactory. Philip Quinn makes this point evident: "Even if it is impossible to assign numerical values to the prior probabilities of various alternatives, it seems clear enough that the prior probability of all humans choosing freely a morally evil supreme maxim must be quite low."[7] How can we make a universal judgment on limited data when the probability of past, present, and future unknown actions is so pathetically low? The problem is really quite acute. As Firestone and Jacobs note, "If Kant's argument treats evil as the product of a spontaneous act of the will, which can find no causal basis outside of the will itself, then Kant cannot defend the universality of radical evil [on the basis of a collection of individual actions]."[8] Evil in Pasternack's comparative sense is hardly "radical" (i.e., a spontaneous act of freedom that corrupts the ground of all our maxims for the whole species) but is at best a psychological description of something like what must be happening when, in their earliest moral decisions, individual humans reject the moral law as their highest incentive.[9] In other words, Pasternack's Kant is really not determining anything at all; he is telling a story about the human religious consciousness animated by the strictures and needs of his critical philosophy that also kowtows to key elements of the Christian narrative.

Kant turns in Book Two to seek a solution for this comparatively universal problem and ends up adding on a descriptive psychological account of how humans go about changing their hearts. Kant's no-nonsense language about the "objective reality of the prototype," for Pasternack, refers merely to a rational ideal (159). We can focus on this ideal, which "resides in reason," and thereby develop the rational faith that a change of heart is really possible. Belief in the prototype, according to Pasternack, is not a transcendental condition for the possibility of moral hope but rather a useful idea or ideal for promoting moral progress within ourselves. It makes us believe that moral perfection is possible. All this would be for naught except that God's decision to see us in this new light. "Divine aid is therefore required in order that our efforts (through eternal striving) are accepted as a substitute" (144). This type of semi-Pelagianism is not a form of grace for Kant but rather a way of understanding how we become well-pleasing to God despite our long trail of sins and a disposition that is fundamentally evil. Pasternack claims that we must believe that God never actually forgives us for wrongful thoughts and deeds but rather simply sees us from a whole new perspective -- as if we had never sinned. The entire approach sounds strangely like forgiveness, but Pasternack insists it is not. It is simply a choice on God's part to see us as pleasing despite how we see ourselves. "From our human perspective, we will see ourselves as always needing improvement. But God can judge our [disposition] Gesinnung" (148).

It is not clear to me that any competent Christian theologian would accept Pasternack's claim that the above account is not a form of forgiveness. Here is how Pasternack describes it: "When a judgment is dismissed, or a statue struck down, it is not that the guilty are forgiven -- rather, the change in evaluation occurs at a deeper level than with forgiveness. The forgiven are guilty, but treated mercifully. The 'relieved' are no longer guilty" (157). Questions emerge immediately. What is this something deeper? How does it happen? Does it come from within or without? The economy of God's nature, thinks Kant, must maintain a strict sense of moral justice, and this cannot be satisfied with just a good college try. If this were the case, it would end up becoming a cheap grace that neither elevates the moral law to its proper place nor understands God as a worthy moral lawgiver. If this is what happens when Christianity is abstracted into moral psychology, then it simply will not do. A morally just God cannot ignore our transgressions. Rather, there must be a more ontologically robust solution to our moral dilemma or the two experiments of Religion will simply fail. How do we cover for the infinite dispositional guilt of our fallen natures and the finite past and future sins we commit as individuals? For Pasternack, we don't and we don't need to. God fudges in his judgment of us by seeing us not for what we are but rather for what we may become in some indefinite future that God extrapolates on our behalf.

Pasternack's Kant must diverge from Lutheranism on fundamental points of doctrine (i.e., vicarious atonement) to satisfy his critical strictures. However, Pasternack does not replace these doctrines with viable theological alternatives. Rather, he sets up a false dichotomy between Lutheranism (and its variants) and Pelagianism (and its variants) as if Kant's position on theological atonement was limited to them alone.[10] Pasternack's Kant, in going this redemptive route, contradicts his earlier statements concerning the necessary separation of philosophy and theology in order to achieve his religious objectives. One place that this comes out very clearly is the Pasternack's linchpin interpretive moment in Book Two where the need for a change of heart turns into the ability of human beings to change our own hearts without God's provision of the disposition of the prototype. However, Pasternack's whole interpretation of Religion hinges on the postulate of God for the achievement of the Highest Good. In fact, the pursuit of the Highest Good is a duty, thinks Pasternack, and belief in God is a necessary aspect of its achievement, but God is left out of the change of heart altogether. Surely, there are better theological options at Kant's disposal, but one would never know it reading Pasternack's treatment.

The interpretations of Books Three and Four receive less attention and carry less significance for his overall interpretation. He understands them as the social extensions of Books One and Two that establish a chiastic literary relationship of corruption and redemption. Where Books One and Two deal with the corruption and redemption of the individual, Books Three and Four deal with the redemption and corruption of the common institutions that help or hinder the journey of the individual toward the Highest Good. By the end, Pasternack has provided an able guidebook of terms and issues in and around the Religion text. His reading appears articulate if somewhat insulated from ongoing debates surrounding the conundrums within Religion and alternative theological resources at Kant's disposal. Ironically, Luther's notion of salvation by faith alone and in Christ alone is lost in translation, and what we are left with is a psychology of religion that supports a works-based moral soteriology. Kant cannot be consistent with his own claims to be a pure philosopher, and he cannot develop rational religious faith in God that maintains God's strict moral justice in the face of human regenerative transformation.

ACKNOWLEDGEMENT

My thanks to Brandon Love for a series of helpful conversations over the details of this book.