That the history and the philosophy of science have been united in a form of disciplinary marriage is a fact. There are pressing questions about the state of this union. Discourse on a New Method: Reinvigorating the Marriage of History and Philosophy of Science is a state of the union address, but also an articulation of compelling and well-defended positions on strategies for making progress in the history and philosophy of science. The positions taken in the book take their inspiration, whether sympathetically or more critically, from the philosophy of Michael Friedman. This volume demonstrates that Friedman's work on history and philosophy of science, and on the history of philosophy more generally, is a particularly strong and fruitful basis for a renewed discussion of the way forward. Mary Domski and Michael Dickson have assembled an exceptional roster of contributors, all of whom have engaged significantly with Friedman's work. Beyond that, most of the essays in this volume are ambitious, well crafted, and tightly argued -- and some, in particular, are a joy to read. Friedman's concluding essay is an amazing synthetic work that brings all the threads together, but that also presents and defends a reworked version of the dynamic and constitutive a priori. The result is a volume that presents the state of the art in the discipline and that will stimulate and inform work on these subjects in the years to come. Moreover, the volume overall does not restrict itself to providing a Festschrift for Friedman, though that word is used. It is a Manifestoschrift, as the subtitle suggests: the aim of the book is to give new direction and vigor to the history and philosophy of science.
Friedman has defended a number of innovative and influential positions on the history and philosophy of science, always, as he says here, from a revised Kantian standpoint. There are many landmarks in the philosophical landscape that we owe to Friedman, including a most plausible elaboration of the logical reading of Kantian geometry, consistent with Beth and Hintikka, and a thoroughgoing appreciation of the significance of Newton and of Kant's positions in the Metaphysical Foundations of Natural Science to the study of Kant's philosophy, as defended in Kant and the Exact Sciences. The Dynamics of Reason, Friedman's account of the rationality of scientific theory change and theory building in response to Thomas Kuhn, is perhaps most relevant to the methodology of history and philosophy of science.
Introduction
Domski and Dickson present a framework for learning from history, via the notion of "synthetic history." Domski's and Dickson's conception of synthetic history is intended explicitly to show that one need not accept the (neo-)Kantian framework of the dynamic and relativized a priori in order to pursue a broadly Friedmannian project in history and philosophy of science (16). Rather, they identify several key features of Friedman's approach that are shared by the contributors to the volume, even by those who do not agree with Friedman's (neo-)Kantian framework:
1. There is a difference between the descriptive claim that philosophy has interacted with the sciences and the normative claim that philosophy ought to engage with the sciences and their history. Friedman makes the latter claim (7). Here, as the editors point out, Friedman engages with the historical thought of Richard Westfall, Thomas Kuhn, and Ernst Cassirer (9). The editors note that one need not accept Kantian or neo-Kantian claims in order to accept that, as Norwood Russell Hanson put it, philosophy of science without history of science is empty.
2. The editors present a shared set of compelling questions for historians and philosophers of science about the differing methodologies and approaches of historians and philosophers. These questions were put forcefully by Ronald Giere (1973) in his "History and Philosophy of Science: Intimate Relationship or Marriage of Convenience?" Such questions, not limited to Giere's own, might include: Do the methods employed by historians of science -- "focused, more or less, on the specific events, contexts, and influences surrounding the development and acceptance or rejection of a concept or theory" -- provide material to draw useful philosophical lessons, without further argument (2-3)? On the other hand, does reading an episode in the history of science as an illumination of a philosophical problem, such as induction or scientific realism, illegitimately impose the concerns of the present on the practices and arguments of the past? Giere suggests that historians and philosophers of science take the burden of proof on themselves, and this volume contains an impressive set of arguments on this score.
3. A final position, implicitly held in common by the contributors to this volume, is a commitment to anti-Whiggishness. As the editors urge, we ought not take history to be a list of failings that lead ineluctably to the glorious present. Rather, history is a teacher, and her teachings allow us to take a more nuanced position on how we should best move forward (17).
One note before moving on: I will not assess Friedman's concluding essay separately, but rather will discuss it in relationship with the essays in the volume.
Parts I and II: "The Newtonian Era" and "Kant"
In his Afterword, "Synthetic History Reconsidered," Friedman treats the Newtonian era "in relation to Kant and Kantian themes" (574). Friedman focuses on Kant's relationship to Newtonian physics and, by extension, on Kant's engagement with the differences between Cartesian, Leibnizian, and Newtonian physics. Friedman pays significant attention to the influence of the theological tradition in the work of Descartes, Newton, and Leibniz; here, he takes his cue from Stephen Menn's excellent study (Menn 1998). Owing to the clear connections between the projects of the two Parts, I will discuss them together.
History of science and methodology of history and philosophy of science
The three essays here are by Domski, Domenico Bertoloni Meli, and William R. Newman. The essays share a focus on historical techniques and methodologies for philosophy and science. In consequence, they address, if implicitly, Giere's challenge for history and philosophy of science. But the essays here go beyond that, to defend controversial and remarkable positions on alchemy, on the place of Newton in the early modern tradition, and on the axiomatic method in history.
In "Newton as Historically-Minded Philosopher," Domski focuses on the distinction between Cartesian and Newtonian methods and arguments in the foundations of geometry. According to Domski, as Friedman points out, "the main target of Newton's rejection of 'relationalism' in favor of an 'absolutist' metaphysics of space is Descartes" (575). In the case of geometry, instead of beginning from Cartesian first principles and clear and distinct ideas, Newton "takes the certainty" of ancient mathematics as his "given" (67). Domski urges, as well, that we take Newton's methods seriously as an attempt to replace Cartesian methods, as an historical form of argument, not as a mere "appeal to authority."
Meli's "The Axiomatic Tradition in Seventeenth-Century Mechanics" explores the "Archimedean tradition" of seeking "principles to which the mind naturally consents, such as symmetry, or principles based on generalized experiences describing the normal course of nature," as opposed to the method of "contrived experiments" often associated with Mersenne, Boyle, and Mariotte (23). Meli sees in Stevin, Galileo, Torricelli, and Huygens a "common concern for establishing knowledge about nature in an axiomatic fashion" (37).
In "The Reduction to the Pristine State in Robert Boyle's Corpuscular Philosophy," Newman argues that "it is precisely the absence of an approach like Friedman's," which provides "an awareness of the interaction between scholastic natural philosophy and empirical practice," that has led scholarship to become "simply adrift in a sea of unrelated facts that lend themselves all too easily to the facile misinterpretations populating past and current surveys of the Scientific Revolution" (43). It is this lack of a coherent narrative of the relationship between natural philosophy and empirical practice "that has led both historians and philosophers to overlook one of the major reasons for the move to corpuscular matter theory in the early modern period" (43). Newman concludes that "It was the field of chymistry [a corpuscularian strain of alchemy] that supplied Boyle's primary ammunition against early modern scholastic matter theory as taught in the universities" (44).
Descartes, Leibniz, Lambert, Newton, Kant
The essays I focus on here are by Andrew Janiak, Alison Laywine, Daniel Sutherland, and Daniel Warren. Collected, these essays give an excellent perspective on the interaction between Kant and the early modern tradition.
An instructive comparison is the recently published (2008) Kant and the Early Moderns, edited by Daniel Garber and Béatrice Longuenesse. In that volume, Anja Jauernig argues against an "influential and popular story about Kant's philosophical development and about his relationship to Leibniz," which has it that Kant, after an "eye-opening" reading of Newton's Principia, at first tried to reconcile the Newtonian picture with the Leibniz-Wolff metaphysics, but was gradually led, over time, to "the total rejection of the Leibniz-Wolffian philosophy in the Critique of Pure Reason" (Jauernig 2008, 41). To Jauernig, this reading "tends to overemphasize Newton's influence in Kant's gradual emancipation from Leibniz-Wolff" (Ibid., 42). She cites Friedman's Kant and the Exact Sciences as one source of this story. She goes on to argue that it is much more likely that, in many cases, Kant was motivated by reasons internal to the Leibniz-Wolff philosophy.
The essays here take their cue from Friedman's work, and the perspective they offer goes well beyond any simple story of the transition from Kant's early work to the reform of metaphysics in the later work. In the context of these narratives, it appears that the dichotomy set up by Jauernig -- In developing the Critical system, was Kant responding to Newton or to internal tensions within Leibnizian metaphysics? -- is too limiting. What about Descartes? What about other figures whom Kant had read and with whom he was in correspondence? While several of the contributions to this volume begin from the thesis of external, Newtonian influence, they by no means suggest that that influence was the only one.
The essays in this section argue for several related claims. First, that Kant's defense of dynamism is traceable to his defense of Newton against Cartesian mechanism (Warren and Janiak). In "Newton's Forces in Kant's Critique," Janiak proposes a way to read the Critique that resolves the tension between Kant's arguments regarding attractive forces in the Amphiboly of the Concepts of Reflection in the first Critique, and Kant's abstract, transcendental form of argument there. Since attractive forces are empirical, it would appear they cannot be given a pure treatment. Janiak goes on to give an account of how Kant's account of forces can be read as part of his overall defense of the Newtonian dynamic picture over the Leibnizian monadic one, and that this context goes some way to resolve the apparent tension.
Second, in "Kant on Attractive and Repulsive Force: The Balancing Argument," Warren too argues that reading Kant's arguments in the context of the defense of dynamism aids in understanding. However, Warren argues that, while Kant thought that we could make substantive claims a priori about the necessary conditions for avoiding the collapse or dispersion of matter, problems arise with his arguments for these "necessary conditions" when they are taken out of the context of the Cartesian mechanism and Newtonian dynamism with which Kant was engaged.
The essays by Laywine and Sutherland support the view that Kant intended a thoroughgoing reform of metaphysics. They present a nuanced picture of this intended reform, based partly on Kant's evolving views on the role of mathematics, especially geometry, with respect to metaphysics. Sutherland's essay, "Philosophy, Geometry, and Logic in Leibniz, Wolff, and the Early Kant," focuses on the pre-Critical period, in particular, on the Inquiry Concerning the Distinctness of the Principles of Natural Theology and Morality. Sutherland gives a very clear account of Kant's early rejection, in the Inquiry, of Leibniz's universal characteristic, but also of Kant's later willingness to "entertain the possibility" of an ars combinatoria based on the categories (185).
Laywine's "Kant and Lambert on Geometrical Postulates in the Reform of Metaphysics" takes as its goal to "make one concrete suggestion: [Johann Heinrich] Lambert gave Kant the interesting idea that geometrical postulates in Euclid's sense were somehow essential to the reform of metaphysics they both sought" (114). As Friedman observes in tracing this line of reasoning, Laywine's "very illuminating" contribution makes several intriguing further suggestions (599).
Laywine cites evidence that Kant, unlike Lambert and Wolff, did not take mathematics as a model for metaphysics. Kant thought, nonetheless, that "thinking about the function and significance of postulates" can help philosophers to better understand problems in metaphysics (122). Laywine's essay traces the role Kant's thought about postulates may have had as a background to the Transcendental Deduction. The key to understanding this, Laywine suggests, is in reading the use of "the constructive postulates of geometry" as suggesting an answer to the question Kant raised in his letter to Marcus Herz of February 1772: how is it possible for the intellect, a "faculty that represents objects a priori without being affected by them", to represent objects at all? "The answer apparently depends on being able to establish some kind of relation" between the intellect's representations and their objects (125). The constructive procedures of geometry establish a relationship between geometrical concept and geometrical object. Why not make the case, then, that the understanding can carry out similar constructive procedures that explain how the intellect can represent objects a priori? Laywine concludes by making the interpretive suggestion that the project of the transcendental deduction could be to show that the "logical functions of the understanding … are indeed constructive procedures" (129).
In his concluding essay, Friedman links Laywine's project to his reading of the notion of construction in the Metaphysical Foundations of Natural Science (599ff). These discussions, along with Frederick C. Beiser's essay for this volume, make a persuasive case that an understanding of Kant's conception of construction, whether mathematical or philosophical, is necessary for a complete understanding of Kant's projects in the Critique and in the Metaphysical Foundations.
Kant's Immediate Reception
Beiser's essay, "Mathematical Method in Kant, Schelling, and Hegel," picks up the train of Sutherland's and Laywine's narratives. Instead of considering the relationship between the pre-Critical and Critical Kant, Beiser focuses on Kant's reception in Schelling and Hegel. Beiser begins by emphasizing a question Laywine raises as well: what is Kant's considered viewpoint on the relationship between mathematics and philosophy (243)? Beiser observes that this key question is not much discussed in studies of post-Kantian philosophy. His essay traces the notion of mathematical construction in Schelling and Hegel and its role in allowing for the possibility of "intellectual intuition" (248). Beiser, like Friedman, sees a method of construction at work in Kant's Metaphysical Foundations and sees this method as an inspiration for Schelling's Naturphilosophie. (On this count, see also Friedman's Afterword, 621ff.)
In his "Two Studies in the Reception of Kant's Philosophy of Arithmetic", Charles Parsons evaluates two early receptions of Kant's work on arithmetic, by Schultz and Bolzano. Readers familiar with the Friedman-Parsons debate on Kant's philosophy of geometry might imagine that Parsons's goal is to vindicate his own reading over Friedman's, by arguing that early readers of Kant, including Kant's disciple Schultz, read Kant in a way consistent with Parsons's reading and not Friedman's. But, to Parsons's credit, that is not the goal of this study. Parsons's essay, instead, is a compelling argument that unappreciated problems with Kant's philosophy of arithmetic emerge from close discussion of Bolzano's and Schultz's readings of Kant. (Readers who are interested in the current moves in the Parsons-Friedman debate from Friedman's perspective should turn to Friedman's concluding essay, 585ff.)
Parts III-V: "Logical Positivism and Neo-Kantianism", "History and Philosophy of Physics", and "Post-Kuhnian Philosophy of Science"
The many essays in these three sections deal directly with Friedman's history and philosophy of science, including: his account of the split between analytic and continental traditions, his responses to logical empiricism and to Kuhn's account of scientific change, and his arguments concerning coordination and meaning in modern physics.
Ernst Cassirer and Rudolf Carnap
Friedman's A Parting of the Ways is a penetrating examination of the history of the split between the analytic and continental traditions in philosophy. Friedman identifies three philosophical paths: Carnap's search for "the underlying logical forms" of "the objectivity found in natural scientific knowledge", Heidegger's rejection of this pursuit in favor of a phenomenological "essential analysis", and Cassirer's problematic but promising middle way (Friedman 2000, 148-150).
As Richardson observes in his essay for this volume, some readers "may have been shocked to discover that the real hero of the tale … is not Carnap but Cassirer" (282). Friedman is responsible for the increasing appreciation of Cassirer as a significant figure in his own right. James Mattingly's essay, "The Paracletes of Quantum Gravity," explores further Friedman's sympathetic reading, in the context of modern physics.
Friedman's approach to Cassirer is not exclusively sympathetic. In his "Validity in the Cultural Sciences?" John Michael Krois responds to a criticism of Cassirer's philosophy by Friedman. According to Friedman, Cassirer does not explain how the Geisteswissenschaften are to share in the universal validity of the Naturwissenschaften or, at least, how the types of validity proper to each are to be related to each other (262). As a result, Cassirer abandons his promising middle ground and we are faced with the choice between Carnap and Heidegger. Krois gives a very clear response to this criticism, linked to what Krois sees as the key notion of Cassirer's philosophy of symbolic forms, the idea of "symbolic pregnance." But more than that, Krois's essay provides an excellent introduction to the neo-Kantianism of the nineteenth and early twentieth centuries, as well as a much broader picture of Cassirer's philosophy than has yet been available. As Krois points out, much of Cassirer's most important work has only recently been published (Cassirer 1999).
The essays on Carnap in this volume present a mixed perspective. Alan Richardson sums up his view of the state of scholarship on the Aufbau at the beginning of his essay (279ff.). One reading, perhaps inspired by Quine, sees the Aufbau as the apex of the method of phenomenalist, empiricist reduction using symbolic logic. Another, spearheaded by Richardson and Friedman, sees Kantian and neo-Kantian elements in the Aufbau, especially in the analysis of objectivity. In "From Mach to Carnap: A Tale of Confusion", Paul Pojman interestingly complicates this tale by arguing for two related theses: that Carnap had both empiricist and Kantian aims in the Aufbau and that the supposedly empiricist influence on Carnap, Mach, was not what we now consider to be "Machian."
Two essays address the interpretation of Carnap in detail: Thomas Ricketts's "Quine's Objection and Carnap's Aufbau" and William Demopoulos's "The Role of the Foundations of Mathematics in the Development of Carnap's Theory of Theories." Ricketts focuses on an historical, interpretive thesis, that there is an underlying continuity to Carnap's views on the "relation of observation to physical theory" (313). One story is that Carnap was persuaded by Quine to abandon his original project altogether. Ricketts gives a different reading, according to which Carnap's seeming change of heart was instead a developing appreciation of the limits of "what can and cannot be defined in the formal languages with which he is working" (326). The contentious part of Ricketts's essay is that he sees this appreciation as evolving in tandem with Carnap's application of "critical conventionalism," the notion that multiple models of the phenomena exist and that the choice between them is underdetermined and based on simplicity (318). Richardson sees critical conventionalism as in tension with the project of the Aufbau; Ricketts does not see a tension there (319). Thus, while this paper defends a nominally historical thesis, the philosophical stakes for Carnap interpretation turn out to be significant.
The subject of the influence of Hilbert's axiomatization on logical empiricism receives less attention than it should. Demopoulos's essay, a further development of the ideas from Demopoulos and Friedman (1985) and Demopoulos (2007), explores the influence of Hilbert's axiomatic methods on Carnap's project of rational reconstruction. Demopoulos gives a rich and technically precise account of Carnap's use of Hilbert's mathematical methods in the Geometry of 1899 to develop his "theory of theories". Perhaps the most compelling aspect of the essay is Demopoulos's suggestion that Carnap's view of truth owes something to Hilbert's (475 and passim), a significant revision to our understanding of Carnap's account of the epistemology and reconstruction of empirical theories.
Physics, Mathematics, and the Dynamic A Priori
In The Dynamics of Reason, Friedman distinguishes between two senses of the a priori: as an unrevisable and infallible set of a priori principles, versus a set of presuppositions constitutive of the meaning of empirical propositions (Friedman 2001, 74). For instance, Newton's laws of motion are part of the framework within which Newton's law of gravitation acquires empirical content (Ibid., 37). In arguing for the latter, constitutive sense, Friedman argues for two theses. First, that the constitutive a priori is dynamic, that is, that it can change over time, which accommodates Kuhn's arguments regarding paradigm shifts in science. Second, though, that Kuhn's arguments regarding the incommensurability of successive paradigms threaten a slide into radical relativism (712ff.). Friedman fills this gap with an analysis of the transitions from one set of "locally constitutive" principles, or rules of normal science, to another, which allows for a broader picture of the rationality of theory change. On Friedman's account, practitioners of one part of normal science can have access to the real possibility of a succeeding account (714).
Friedman applies his analysis to the shift from Newton to Einstein in particular. This turns out to be quite significant in a way, perhaps, not fully appreciated as yet. Noretta Koertge's essay, "How Should We Describe Scientific Change? Or: A Neo-Popperian Reads Friedman," makes the point that, by focusing on the special case of mechanics and physics, Friedman has prejudiced the case in his favor; other disciplines, such as chemistry, may not be amenable to his treatment. Friedman responds as follows: "what I call the dynamics of reason is not intended to be a general theory of scientific change at all -- rather, it is a particular historical narrative accompanied by a particular philosophical gloss" (715). The shift from Newton to Einstein is the most potent challenge to the Kantian ideal of rationality, Friedman says; one can extrapolate, perhaps, that the shift from one theory to another in chemistry or in anthropology does not pose such a challenge.
The essays by Don Howard, John Norton, Robert DiSalle, Richard Creath, Scott Tanona, Thomas Ryckman, and Dickson explore the scope and limits of Friedman's historical analysis and, in distinct contexts, of his account of the a priori. These essays are rich and rewarding, and represent the vanguard of work on post-Kuhnian philosophy of science, as Friedman dubs it.
In "'Let me briefly indicate why I do not find this standpoint natural.' Einstein, General Relativity, and the Contingent A Priori," Don Howard begins with an appropriately provocative question: "Who is right? Friedman or Einstein?" Friedman argues that the contingent a priori plays a role in "the manner in which theories acquire empirical content" (334). Friedman's defense of the contingent a priori requires at least a functional distinction between a priori and empirical statements of a theory, which rules out a holistic approach to theory appraisal. Howard presents evidence that Einstein himself considered versions of the contingent a priori, as defended by Schlick and Reichenbach, and rejected them, in favor of Duhemian holism. Further, the essay contains an illuminating and persuasive account of Einstein's own view, according to which any particular division of a theory into empirical and a priori elements must always be arbitrary.
The broader approach to historical study that Howard defends, then, is that we ought not "privilege contemporary rational reconstructions over the self-understandings of the historical actors themselves" (350). Historical context can clarify our perspective, or it can muddy it, by introducing the concerns of the present into the reconstruction of the past. If our rational reconstruction of a theory requires that we discount the methodological approach of "the historical actors themselves," that is an excellent reason to question the reconstruction.
The conflict between Friedman's view, as currently stated, and Howard's account, as presented here, will no doubt stimulate reflection and work on these questions. While reading Howard's essay, I was reminded of Friedman's remark, in response to Koertge, that his theory of the dynamics of reason was not intended as a general theory of scientific change. Instead, it was intended to defend Kant's "Enlightenment ideal of rationality". Howard's essay raises a key and very compelling question: to what extent can we divorce the dynamics of reason from the "battle-tested empirical generalizations" and from the facts on the ground, in any account of scientific change (349)?
Tanona's rich essay, "Theory, Coordination, and Empirical Meaning in Modern Physics," addresses a question very similar to Howard's. And the comparison between Norton's essay, "How Hume and Mach Helped Einstein Find Special Relativity," and DiSalle's essay, "Synthesis, the Synthetic A Priori, and the Origins of Modern Space-Time Theory," is a case in point of the difference between the dynamic a priori and the more empirical approach. Norton's essay gives us a careful and historically accurate account of how Einstein responded to problems embedded in nineteenth-century electromagnetic theory. DiSalle's essay, equally careful and quite detailed, focuses on the conceptual changes and transformations involved in the development of the theory of space-time. Friedman and DiSalle see their approaches as "complementary," though Friedman carefully distinguishes the two positions and, it is worth mentioning, brings up the question of the contribution of empirical facts on the ground (718ff.).
The question is of the reconstruction of scientific change. Friedman's account and the accounts inspired by Friedman tend to focus on the conceptual and mathematical continuity between frameworks. DiSalle emphasizes the role of philosophical reflection in theory construction (528), which is, indeed, complementary to Friedman's approach. Norton's, Howard's, and Tanona's essays insist on a strong role for the empirical groundwork for those changes.
Creath's essay, "The Construction of Reason: Kant, Carnap, Kuhn, and Beyond," and Ryckman's "The 'Relativized A Priori': An Appreciation and a Critique," address the foundations of the dynamics of reason from quite different perspectives. Creath, first, gives an analysis of Friedman's notion of communicative rationality and the dynamics of reason; and second, questions whether Friedman's account is better than Quine's as a descriptive project for science, concluding that this is a difficult matter to prove. Ryckman, on the other hand, argues that Friedman's defense of rationality against relativism will succeed only if Friedman "takes on board something like the intentional-analytic framework of phenomenological idealism" (466).
Finally, Dickson's essay, "Beauty Doth of Itself Persuade: Dirac on Quantization, Mathematical Beauty, and Theoretical Understanding," stands out among the others as an account of the role of mathematics in scientific understanding. Dickson develops a view, which he takes from Dirac, that mathematical beauty originates from mathematical generality and that mathematical generality contributes to our understanding. First, it does so by contributing to the construction of scientific theories that aid in understanding nature; and second, it does so by allowing us to better understand the theories themselves. The essay is clear, well defended, and itself a beautiful piece of work.
Overall, the essays in this section, along with the treatment of "Post-Kuhnian Philosophy of Science" in Friedman's concluding essay, reveal that there are lively disputes here over significant questions and that much work remains to be done. Does Kuhn's account of theory change threaten to slide into relativism or Quinean naturalism? If so, does Friedman's account halt the slide? How ought we integrate the account of the dynamics of reason into a broad account of scientific theory change, including experiment, evidence, and sciences other than physics and mechanics? What is the contribution of mathematical and conceptual analysis to theory construction and appraisal in science and in philosophy?
The questions most pressing for Friedman's philosophy of science are among those most pressing for the history and the philosophy of science in general. This volume, as a whole, is an excellent further step on the path toward more productive debate on these issues.
References
Cassirer, Ernst. 1999. Ziele und Wege der Wirklichkeitserkenntnis. (ECN 2), edited by Klaus Christian Köhnke and J. M. Krois.
Demopoulos, William. 2007. "Carnap on the Reconstruction of Scientific Theories", in M. Friedman and R. Creath, eds., The Cambridge Companion to Carnap. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 248-272.
Demopoulos, William and Friedman, Michael. 1985. "Russell's Analysis of Matter: Its Historical Context and Contemporary Interest," Philosophy of Science 52: 621-39.
Friedman, Michael. 2000. A Parting of the Ways: Carnap, Cassirer, and Heidegger. LaSalle, Illinois: Open Court.
Friedman, Michael. 2001. Dynamics of Reason. The 1999 Kant Lectures at Stanford University. Stanford: CSLI Publications.
Garber, Daniel and Longuenesse, Béatrice, eds., 2008. Kant and the Early Moderns. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
Giere, Ronald. 1973. "History and Philosophy of Science: Intimate Relationship or Marriage of Convenience?" British Journal of the Philosophy of Science 24: 282-297.
Jauernig, Anja. 2008. "Kant's Critique of the Leibnizian Philosophy: Contra the Leibnizians, but Pro Leibniz", in Garber and Longuenesse, op. cit., 41-63.
Menn, Stephen. 1998. Descartes and Augustine. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.