Michael LeBuffe’s From Bondage to Freedom: Spinoza on Human Excellence is an excellent presentation of Spinoza’s moral theory. LeBuffe presents and analyzes not only the moral theory itself but also its place in Spinoza’s system. This book is a significant contribution that ought to be read by anyone interested in the ethics or moral psychology of early modern philosophy, in addition to Spinoza scholars.
Consider Spinoza’s Ethics. How does one approach such a monumental work? One could say that readers should begin at the beginning. This tactic mirrors many interpretations of his work, in that readers often interpret its later parts in terms of the earlier doctrines. To be sure, such a method can lead to profound results. For example, Michael Della Rocca’s recent book, Spinoza, interprets Spinoza’s system from the perspective of the principle of sufficient reason, which appears in the second axiom of Part One and, more clearly, a few pages later in the 11th proposition, allowing him a powerful and informative lens with which to view Spinoza.
This is not the only avenue of entry into Spinoza’s system, however. Instead of beginning at the beginning, one may skip ahead to the end and see whodunit. Indeed, several considerations justify such an approach. For one, Spinoza’s system is synthetic and geometric in form: geometric in that it proceeds like a demonstration from Euclid’s Elements, employing deductive inference from axioms and definitions to propositions; and synthetic in that it begins at the simplest concepts and builds up to something more complex, ostensibly the aim of the demonstration. The Ethics culminates with a discussion of the highest human good, suggesting that this doctrine may be the aim of Spinoza’s project, the earlier parts having been presented in service to this end. What’s more, Spinoza himself claims that his goal is, ultimately, to lead us to “knowledge of the human mind and its highest blessedness” (Preface, Part II). So, another way to read the Ethics is to begin with its end in mind.
Michael LeBuffe takes such an approach, presenting an interpretation of Spinoza’s thought that puts these considerations at the forefront. By focusing on Spinoza’s moral theory, LeBuffe provides the reader with two benefits: first, his focus affords us a valuable lens through which to view Spinoza’s system; second, his explanation demonstrates the appeal of Spinoza’s moral theory in its own right.
According to LeBuffe, Spinoza’s moral theory brings together several disparate strands of Spinoza’s thought, strands with which commentators have wrestled for some time. The first strand concerns Part III’s conatus, the striving to persevere in our being that constitutes our essence. Throughout Part III and into Part IV, Spinoza describes this essence as a striving to persevere in our being, where that is understood as whatever increases our power of acting. Spinoza builds a value system onto this story, whereby that which increases our power and thus aids our persevering is good and that which does not is bad. By the time we reach Part V, however, Spinoza has switched his terminology, understanding good and bad in terms of knowledge and ignorance, or activity and passivity of the mind. LeBuffe states the issue as follows, saying, “What is the relationship between these two ends of human action, perseverance in being and knowledge?” (21). The answer to this question lies at the heart of LeBuffe’s project here.
LeBuffe begins with a dense and quote-laden introduction aimed at Spinoza specialists, after which he settles into a more approachable style. After laying out some metaphysical background found in Part I of the Ethics, LeBuffe turns to the prescriptions at the beginning of Part V. He interprets these prescriptions by way of a comparison to Descartes’s account of the avoidance of error. We are predisposed to error due to our natural over-reliance on sensory data, Descartes and Spinoza suggest. We can combat this prejudice by cultivating an opposing disposition, thus countering its force, though doing so does not eliminate the natural disposition. Both Spinoza and Descartes illustrate this process with their sun analogy. Our senses provide us with a pre-theoretical idea of the sun as being relatively small and near. After studying astronomy, however, we gain a new idea of the sun, one that represents it as being huge and distant. This new knowledge does not change the sensory character of the sun when we view it. It still appears to be the same size as it did before, but we now have grounds for an alternative belief about the sun from which to make judgments and act. Spinoza establishes the psychological mechanisms involved here in his account of confusion and the imagination in Part II. LeBuffe looks to these accounts in Part II in order to make sense of Spinoza’s prescriptions at the beginning of Part V. This is an interesting, important, and insightful move.
Based on his work on confusion in the previous chapter, LeBuffe next presents an interpretation of representation in Spinoza, one that is a hybrid of Margaret Wilson’s and Michael Della Rocca’s interpretations. According to LeBuffe’s Spinoza, ideas represent their objects in an extensional sense, due to those ideas being caused by their objects, but not necessarily in an intensional sense. In other words, it may be that ideas are caused by objects, yet the representational contents of those ideas do not involve their causes at all. Though this may be a peculiar account of representation, LeBuffe makes a strong textual case for it.
What’s more, this interpretation of representation in Spinoza, based on his account of confusion in the imagination, allows LeBuffe to explain how the passions mislead us. LeBuffe invites us to consider the protagonist of Anna Karenina. Anna feels a passionate yet destructive love for Vronski. She represents Vronski as the cause of her passion, when, in fact, her passion is likely caused by something else, perhaps her unhappy marriage or isolation. Anna’s affect has Vronski as its mental content, but is caused by her unhappy marriage. LeBuffe argues that there is a confusion involved in Anna’s passion. For that reason, Anna ought to detach her turbulent state of mind from the false cause and attach it to the true one, thus bringing its representational content into line with the causal story.
By this point LeBuffe argues that we can take up our fight against the passions in two ways. We can fight in what LeBuffe calls “the arena of the idea,” where we try to make each individual idea as active and adequate as possible, thus reducing the power of the particular passion in question, as in the case of Anna’s coming to understand her passion for Vronski. We do this when the representational content of our ideas correspond to their real causes. Or we may fight in “the arena of the mind,” wherein we try to accumulate adequate ideas and active affects that can counterbalance our passions and inadequate ideas, as in the case of the sun analogy. In the former case, we work to transform each passionate affect into an active affect though understanding it. In the latter, we do not try to reform our passions or remove our inadequate ideas, but instead try to cultivate opposing, active affects and adequate ideas. The former is a more powerful means to self-improvement, but the possibility of success in the arena of the idea is limited, due to our finite nature and to the intractable nature of many of our affects. It is for this reason that the second arena becomes important, where we cultivate the active affects of nobility and tenacity to help us resist those passions we cannot transform into active affects. One bonus of this account of representation and the passions is its success at uniting the seemingly unconnected discussions at the end of Part IV and the beginning of Part V into a single moral system. Those at the end of Part IV primarily concern the arena of the mind, while those at the beginning of Part V primarily concern the arena of the idea.
LeBuffe next presents an interpretation of the conatus and its role in moral psychology. LeBuffe’s opponent in this section is a (perhaps overly) simplistic psychological egoism according to which all human actions are performed because of a conscious desire to persevere in one’s own being based, in part, on 3p9 (the 9th proposition of Part III), where Spinoza says, “The mind … strives to persevere in its being … and is conscious of this striving.” LeBuffe employs his hybrid theory of representation and argues that, on the contrary, though we represent our striving, we do not necessarily have perseverance as a part of our mental content. The striving to persevere causes our conscious desires, but that does not mean that our conscious desires are for perseverance. Instead, the mental content of our desires is determined by what brings us laetitia (happiness, broadly construed) or tristitia (sadness), as explained in 3p28. The connection between happiness and sadness and our striving to persevere is this: when we pursue happiness and avoid sadness from adequate ideas, that is, accurately, our actions best aid our perseverance. And so it is essential that we try to increase our adequate ideas and try to act from them and the related active affects, rather than from inadequate ideas. Much of what LeBuffe says in these chapters will be familiar to Spinoza scholars, but his use of the imagination and confusion, which informs his theory of representation, allows him to tell a coherent and unifying story stretching from Part II to Part V. What’s more, he achieves this unity by seeing that these four parts all aim at the ethical goal that LeBuffe has emphasized from the beginning.
After presenting his systematic and thoroughly interesting account of Spinoza’s moral psychology, LeBuffe turns to Spinoza’s use of value terms. LeBuffe borrows from Stephen Darwall’s reading of Hobbes, claiming that Spinoza is a projectivist, meaning that our ascriptions of value are, in fact, simply statements that we desire the thing in question. LeBuffe then addresses the Humean worry of deriving an ‘ought’ from an ‘is’. Deleuze presented a Nietzschean reading of Spinoza that gets around this problem by denying that there are any ‘oughts’ at all — that Spinoza replaces the truly moral concepts of good and evil with the descriptive ones of good and bad, useful and not useful. LeBuffe goes the other way, arguing that Spinoza’s metaphysics includes value from the start. The human essence is a striving for perseverance, or an increase in power, all of which Spinoza identifies with the good. So, instead of saying that virtue and goodness, for Spinoza, are in no way value terms, LeBuffe claims that striving and power, which are basic metaphysical components of reality, are themselves value-laden, so Hume’s complaint does not really apply. LeBuffe notes one problem with this interpretation: it leaves Spinoza no account of why the good is good. It gives no reason why striving to persevere in our being, or to increase our power, ought to be our end in the first place. LeBuffe acknowledges that Spinoza leaves this meta-ethical question unanswered, but he claims that this is not so large a problem. After all, Spinoza’s project is to provide us with a means to the good life, not to tell us why the good life is the good life. LeBuffe’s reply here may not satisfy some readers, however. I also would have liked to have seen an account of how Spinoza could be a projectivist about value while holding value to be a fundamental part of his metaphysics.
In Chapter Ten, LeBuffe applies his analyses of the imagination, representation, the conatus, and value to a unified presentation of Spinoza’s moral theory. This is no small task, for Spinoza’s text includes passages that place him in several different traditions, including perfectionism, virtue ethics, and consequentialism. There are also a variety of different kinds of normative claim: prescriptions concerning how to resist passions, means to perseverance, and techniques of self-diagnosis. Nevertheless, LeBuffe’s account succeeds in synthesizing these distinct aspects of Spinoza’s system into a systematic and coherent whole.
In the final chapters, LeBuffe takes up two of the most opaque doctrines of Spinoza’s thought: the third kind of knowledge, which Spinoza takes to be our highest good, and the eternity of the soul. In the penultimate chapter, LeBuffe argues that the third kind of knowledge, which is a knowledge of the essence of a particular thing proceeding from the divine essence, is in fact just self-knowledge. This is an attractive take on the third kind of knowledge, but much of what LeBuffe claims seems to require an unjustified equation of knowledge of God with self-knowledge. For example, LeBuffe points to 5p14, where Spinoza says we can associate our affects with the idea of God — but an association is not the identification that seems required here. Further, this proposition also suggests that it is very easy to achieve a degree of self-knowledge, specifically, that God is the cause of our particular affects. Yet later on Spinoza presents the third kind of knowledge and its attendant salvation as being only accessible by the few, which may cut against the equation of the third kind of knowledge with self-knowledge. Regardless of these difficulties, I think LeBuffe’s take is basically right.
In the final chapter, LeBuffe argues that Spinoza’s doctrine of the eternity of the soul is not really the metaphysical claim that the soul can survive the death of the body. Many interpreters have argued against an ‘immortality of the soul’ reading, of course. LeBuffe further claims, however, that Spinoza really did intend to speak temporally when he discusses the eternity of the soul — that is, to talk eschatologically — but that Spinoza’s doing so is propaedeutic, meant to help us imagine the mind’s eternity as it really is, which does not include survival after death.
Overall, LeBuffe’s From Bondage to Freedom: Spinoza on Human Excellence is an important contribution to Spinoza scholarship. LeBuffe’s use of the imagination and confusion to inform our understanding of representation and the conatus is by itself sufficient to recommend this book. Beyond that fascinating take on Spinoza’s moral psychology lies another successful interpretive contribution — a lucid presentation of Spinoza’s moral theory that brings together the disparate aspects of his system. For these reasons, those interested in ethics or moral psychology in the early modern period would also benefit from reading this book. In the end, LeBuffe’s engaging account unifies Spinoza’s project in a way few others do and it does so around what is undoubtedly Spinoza’s own central concern — the means by which human beings may move from bondage to freedom.