J. Baird Callicott and James McRae have brought together fifteen scholars' views on the relation of Japanese thought to modern environmental concerns. The editors accurately portray these contents as drawing from a wide range of philosophical sources, such as Dōgen and Kūkai's Buddhist non-dualism, Kuki Shūzo's Structure of Iki [living / breathing / stylishly cool], Alfred North Whitehead's process perspectivism, the business ethics of kyōsei [co-habitation], and even the structure of Japanese language itself. However, Carl C. Becker's forward, in which he describes generational changes in how modern Japan lives nature, pulls on the strongest thread running through most of these chapters: the natural environment embedded in human culture generally, and Japanese culture in particular. This is addressed both in the abstract, with many articles drawing on Watsuji Testurō and his arguments for the intertwining of culture and nature, as well as in the concrete, looking at Shinto traditions in specific regions of Japan that connect people's attention and concern to features of the land. A few of these articles lean more towards anthropology than what Westerners usually call philosophy, but their connection and value to environmental concerns is very clear. What follows are my brief summaries of these articles, highlighting a few salient features that I discern in them.
I will first note that Watsuji Testurō's philosophy, particularly Fūdo [Climates and Cultures], looms large within many of these articles. For example, Inutsuka Yu focuses most clearly on this thinker, tracing the development of Watsuji's ideas to his early lecture notes on Heidegger, where he critiques a lack of awareness of space and place within Being and Time. There Heidegger tended to understand the environment (both natural and man-made) as primarily "ready-to-hand," which sells short the more intimate coupling Watsuji has in mind between human beings and nature, in which nature and culture are already an intrinsic part of what it means to exist. Although Watsuji's developed ethics center on the value of trust between humans, this trust rests on the foundation of rhythms, including days, seasons, and weather changes, that are a joint product of both nature and culture.
Steven Bein develops Watsuji's point by arguing that this climatic foundation cannot change without also changing human culture. It follows that climate change, which was not understood as a significant phenomenon in Watsuji's time, must therefore also entail cultural change. This is seen not only in the increased occurrence of natural disasters, but also in wars in developing countries over diminishing resources. Bein also points out that even climate denial is motivated by the fear of change in people's industries and livelihoods that would be entailed by accepting climate change. Some caution is needed in interpreting his claim too generally, however, as the sheer amount of climate denial in America appears to be a unique phenomenon among developed nations.
Like Watsuji, Kuki Shūzo also understands human culture as rooted in nature. Yamauchi Tomosaburō shows parallels in structure between Kuki's three moments of Japanese culture (Shinto nature, Confucian spirit, and Buddhist resignation) and Plato's tripartite account of the soul (respectively, appetite, spirit, and reason.) While Yamauchi believes that Plato inspired Kuki's structure, this comparison also demonstrates a significant contrast, in that nature is a far more encompassing aspect than mere appetite. The Platonic omission of nature at the base of what it means to be human has impeded the West from recognizing the immense damage inflicted by industrialization. However, both Platonic reason and Buddhist resignation stress the restraint of excess desires, desires which are just as much at the root of the excessive consumption that fuels the environmental crises of today. Paring back human desires would undoubtedly do massive ecological good while promoting a healthier and more harmonious society.
Just as Watsuji did in his Ethics, Augustin Berque begins his contribution with a consideration of the features of Japanese language, such as the use of onomatopoeia and sentences without a grammatical subject. These linguistic features create what Berque calls an ambience in which the speaker is immersed in an activity unfolding within a given context. This model is then applied to Watsuji's relationship between culture and climate, such that culture should be understood as a response and interpretation of its local climate, rather than climate alone determining culture, for which Watsuji is sometimes mistakenly criticized. Berque then examines how the controversial biologist Imanishi Kinji extended this perspectivism beyond humans into the animal realm, suggesting that environmental sciences and ethics must consider how the environment is experienced by various sentient beings, rather than the "view from nowhere" often taken in the sciences, which ignores who it is for whom something becomes.
Steve Odin attempts to take this perspectivism further by examining Alfred North Whitehead, George Herbert Mead, and Jürgen Habermas; he employs the latter two's revision of Kant's categorical imperative, in which they formulate ethical maxims by imaginatively taking on the perspective of all community members. Odin then combines this approach with Whitehead's extension of Levinas' monads beyond humans into animals, and even further into the varied perspectives of reality itself. This article is loosely related to Japan by noting significant parallels between Whitehead and Nishida Kitarō's own developments of both Levnias and Hua-Yen Buddhism. However, when applying this perspectivism to the environment, Odin only in passing suggests that there is some sense to taking on the perspective of a mountain, even though this is a central notion that merits much more attention.
In order to pursue this idea to its completion, it is left to Graham Parkes to draw upon Dōgen and Kūkai's writings on the land preaching the Buddha dharma. Parkes dispenses with several mistaken interpretations of Buddhist non-dualism and instead focuses on the value of each thing realizing itself as it is in its own dharma-position, that is to say, that it is good for a tree to go on "treeing," rivers and valleys to go on "becoming" rivers and valleys, and therefore, for a mountain to go on doing what is necessary for it to "become" a mountain within its environment. Humans must therefore take care that their intervention does not excessively damage these innate natural ends.
Ishida Masato compliments Parks' conclusions by investigating Dōgen's views on doing good and maintaining hygiene, insofar as these both encompass purifying acts. It is a reminder that Buddhist non-dualism should not be read as promoting passivity and permissiveness, as some of Dōgen's contemporaries and wayward students seem to have done at times, but that walking the Buddha path means doing good acts. Ishida therefore draws a parallel between the high value Dōgen places on monks keeping themselves clean, and the imperative for humans to clean up their pollution disasters, such as the radiation leaking from the damaged Fukushima nuclear plant. The comparison may be slightly stretched, but the basic conclusion is correct, in that Dōgen would insist on returning nature to a pristine condition.
McRae shows parallel ethical concerns in kyōsei, the Japanese business ethics of mutual benefit, which itself developed out of biological models delineating possible relationships between organisms, with symbiosis taken as the ideal. When this model is applied back to nature, it suggests that humans should seek actions that benefit both humans and nature, or at least one of the two, while avoiding those with an unfavorable impact on either group, such as humans acting as parasites on nature. Although this view does not seem dramatically different from the other approaches in this book demonstrating the close relationship of humans to nature, it is perhaps of most interest to corporations, which themselves often have enormous impacts on the natural environment as well as human society.
Moving from the abstract to the more concrete, there are several contributions that look at examples of Japanese culture and their interrelation with the environment. Shinto traditions show a way in which local Japanese cultures have developed an intimate bond with the land. Midori Kagawa-Fox provides an exhaustive, if sometimes meandering, overview of these Shinto roots, tracing their influence on the role of nature within modern Japanese thought. Kami have long served in part as mediators between human goals and the needs and powers of nature, with kami themselves embodying different aspects of the land and the life within it, and stories and traditions around the kami embodying traditional wisdom as to how humans should act within it. Goda Hiroko looks at some of these specific local customs to demonstrate how kami help humans relate to the land. She describes her research into "night kagura," staged performances in which dancers play mythical beings engaged in various activities, such as a new kami negotiating with the existing ones for permission to farm the land, or Susanō slaying the eight-headed snake symbolizing flooding in the Izumo plain. This description is wrapped with an introduction that favors understanding Shinto as "animatism," meaning that "inanimate" objects have their own inherent energy and motives, and a conclusion that connects the embodiment of the performers re-creating the eternal time of the Shinto myths with their very bodies. The point derived from a slightly odd pastiche of different philosophers seems to be nonetheless valid, in that Kagura performance manifests and realizes the connection of Japanese people with nature embedded in their cultural heritage.
Takahashi Takao employs these traditions to draw attention to the limits of human control over the environment, such as in the deadly tsunami that resulted from the great Tohoku earthquake. He suspects that a kind of human arrogance has guided the environmental discussion, focusing entirely on the impact humans can and do have on the environment, and insufficiently on the mysterious and uncontrollable power of nature as seen in natural disasters. In more traditional Japanese arrangements, humans recognize both their ability to affect nature in the guise of kami, as well as how those kami remain beyond their control. They respond to the kami, and therefore nature, with fear of natural disasters, as well as awe at its intrinsic beauty and value. This urges humans to promote order and flourishing in both the natural and human worlds as much as possible, protecting nature while mitigating the inevitable impact of natural disasters.
By contrast, Toyoda Mitsuyo is concerned that for most people of industrialized countries, including modern Japan, nature has become an abstraction, apart from disasters, even for those living in rural areas. Therefore, environmental concerns are often mere abstractions that are difficult for most to care about. Toyoda is engaged in the practical education of people to help restore some of that environmental concern, especially with regard to land development, and the value of matching new structure and landscape designs to existing land features, rather than the common practice of imposing generic industrial designs on them. This chapter applies to civil engineering the same aesthetic values shown in Japanese gardening as described by Yurikō Saito's chapter. The latter's contribution is a helpful clarification for outsiders who might draw too superficial an impression of the aesthetic of Japanese gardens, which are not really "natural," but are rather the product of an enormous human effort to produce something that appears natural and effortless. The tradition of Japanese gardening draws inspiration from the beauty of nature, but in a selective way that appeals to human sensibilities, which demonstrates a genuine intertwining of nature and human culture.
Having looked at several aspects of Japan and its relation to the environment, one may raise the question as to what implications these might have for an international environmental movement. In this vein, Leah Kalmanson focuses on how to approach different local claims concerning the "supernatural" that relate to environmental concerns. For example, in Hawai'i the community rallied against the patenting of genetic modifications of the Taro plant, on the ground that the plant is in fact an elder brother to human beings. These beliefs would not be immediately apparent to Japanese pure-land Buddhists, for example, but can resonate with the previously mentioned chapters that document local Shinto beliefs. Kalmanson's concern is how to take these different beliefs seriously while avoiding taking either an agnostic or perennial attitude towards them; she raises the question, but self-admittedly does not provide an answer.
Kuwako Toshio comes perhaps the closest to addressing the relationship between local cultural concerns and global environmentalism. He led a project to dam and reshape the Ohashi river area, in which he charted compromise and consensus between the competing environmental and human interests of all the local inhabitants and stakeholders. From this local project, he has abstracted principles that can be applied to many projects around the world that seek community participation in environmental interventions, and in so doing he has developed a philosophy that is intensely practical and has a direct impact on numerous people's everyday lives. These principles are also open to local adaptation; for example, while Kuwako sought to take into account diverging opinions in a democratic process, he had to solicit these opinions indirectly to deal with the common Japanese reticence for social conflict. This process also mediates between competing perspectives presented in this very book, such as anthropocentric and de-anthropocentric centers of value, embracing an all-inclusive outlook. It is perhaps the best example in this book of acting locally, and only then thinking globally.
As the foregoing should have made clear, this collection brings together a diversity of thought-provoking views from Japan in an effort to examine environmental concerns with a view to action. Callicott's afterword, however, notes an omission in the volume's cultural approach to environmentalism,. While some chapters connect human culture in general with nature, and others focus on specific responses within specific regions, there is little work done here as to how local cultural environmental responses relate to the international environmental movement. Notwithstanding, this anthology should be read as offering a model rather than a universal principle that can address environmental concerns, even if it may not yet have been elevated to a full-fledged conceptual paradigm. This model becomes understandable once human beings are understood as "beings-in-nature," as is shown in this volume. Unlike the definition of human beings as "beings-outside-of nature," this approach is not interested in providing a stance of theoretically observing the relationship between humans and climate from the so-called "objective" standpoint with a view to finding a universal principle. I hope that this approach can serve as a valuable stepping stone to the kind of radical perspectival reorientation that is required if modern humans are to coexist harmoniously with their surroundings, rather than plunging the globe into deeper crises.