Ernest Sosa's book is about the nature of judgment, and the norms that govern it by virtue of its having that nature. More specifically, he aims to develop and defend a metaphysical account of judgment as an exercise of agency; he also aims to delineate the norms that govern judgment as species of broader genera of norms that govern exercises of agency. Along the way, he settles disputes about the nature of epistemic virtues, the role of pragmatic encroachment in epistemology, the interaction between judgments and degrees of belief, the relation between animal justification and reflective justification, the social construction of epistemic categories, the regress of justifications, the point of ancient and modern skepticism, and the deviant causal chain puzzles that beset contemporary causal accounts in the philosophy of mind.
This book is both monumentally important and largely successful. In what follows, I give an outline of its doctrine, and then raise a question about the enterprise.
I'll begin with agency. On Sosa's view, a being's agency consists in that being's capacity to perform actions freely, or as he sometimes says, by "endeavoring" to perform them. Sosa remains neutral on many of the traditional questions concerning the metaphysics of such endeavoring (e.g.., whether it is compatibilist or not, whether it is fundamental or not). But he intends for such endeavoring -- whatever precisely it consists in -- to be metaphysically distinct from the teleologically guided operation of an organ or a mechanism. The heart does not endeavor to pump blood in the same way in which I endeavor to write this book review. Of course, we may say that writing this review is (part of) my job, just as pumping blood is part of the heart's job. But writing this review is my job only by virtue of my having chosen to do it, whereas the heart never chose its job. Endeavoring, for Sosa, is a matter of doing something by choice.
Since agency is the capacity to engage in an endeavor by choice, epistemic agency is the capacity to engage in an epistemic endeavor by choice. An epistemic endeavor is one that, if successful, constitutes some form of knowledge. But all knowledge, as Sosa has argued at length over the course of many books, involves representation that has the following features: (a) it is accurate, (b) it is formed adroitly, i.e., by the exercise of a(n) (at least minimally reliable) competence to form such representations accurately, and (c) it is apt, i.e., its accuracy manifests the competence by the exercise of which it was adroitly formed. (Notice that characteristic (c) implies both (a) and (b): aptness always involves both accuracy and adroitness.) Thus, an epistemic endeavor is an endeavor to represent aptly. And epistemic agency is the capacity to engage in such endeavors by choice.
Judgment is the exercise of epistemic agency. Thus, judgment is an endeavor to represent aptly. Just as endeavors generally can enjoy different kinds of success, so too can judgments enjoy different kinds of success. Judgment enjoys one form of success when it represents aptly, for then the agent does precisely what she set out to do (whether or not she does it because she set out to do it). Judgment enjoys another form of success when the agent exercises her epistemic agency adroitly in the endeavor to represent aptly, for then the agent makes a skillful effort to do what she sets out to do, whether or not she succeeds in doing it. And judgment enjoys the highest form of success when the judging agent's apt representation manifests the competence by the adroit exercise of which it was formed -- in short, it enjoys the highest form of success when the judging agent's apt representation is itself aptly formed, for then the agent does what she set out to do, and her doing it manifests the skill that she exercised when setting out to do it. This highest form of success is what Sosa calls "full aptness", and it is the kind of knowledge to which human inquiry typically aspires. As Sosa argues in Part IV of his book, such fully apt judgment has played a starring role in the history of Western epistemology: it is the "scientia" to which Descartes aspired, and it is the kind of knowledge against which the Pyrrhonist's modes were directed.
Such full aptness differs from what Sosa has for many years now called "reflective aptness". A reflectively apt performance is a performance that satisfies two independent conditions: first, it is apt, and second, the performer aptly represents it as apt. In contrast, a fully apt performance is a performance the aptness of which manifests the competence that the performer adroitly exercises in choosing to perform it. Full aptness, unlike reflective aptness, is not simply the conjunction of first- and second-order aptness; it is rather a condition in which first-order aptness manifests higher-order aptness.
Of course not all representations result from chosen endeavors, and so not all epistemology is the epistemology of judgment. Some representations occur within us as the result of the normal but non-voluntary functioning of our information-processing systems. Indeed, without input from such systems, there would be nothing that could ground the justification of our judgments. Such justification is grounded in representations that are not chosen, and so are not judgments. Such representations are attractions to judge, and they are of greater or lesser force. Because they are representational states (rather than acts) and because they are of greater or lesser force, and because they guide action even in the absence of judgment, we may think of them as degrees of belief. Such states amount to belief (full stop) when they involve a degree of attraction to judge that is, in a particular context, sufficient for judgment in that particular context. Whether a particular degree of attraction to judge is sufficient for judgment in a particular context will depend on various features of that context, including some pragmatic features, and thus there will be some degree of pragmatic encroachment in what degree of attraction counts as a belief. But there will not in addition be pragmatic encroachment concerning which beliefs count as apt or adroit: such terms of epistemic appraisal must serve as common linguistic coin among interlocutors with very different practical interests and must be projectable by a single individual across circumstances that involve very different practical interests.
In sum, belief is degree of belief contextually sufficient for judgment. Such beliefs, or degrees of belief, are assessable along the same variety of dimensions as our freely chosen endeavors (e.g., judgments) are assessable: they can be assessed for accuracy, for adroitness, and finally for aptness. The difference is that the competence that is more or less adroitly exercised in judgment is an agential competence, whereas the competence that is exercised in the formation of degrees of belief is a sub-agential, information-processing competence. While the latter are assessable along dimensions that are epistemic (because relevant to knowledge), these assessments do not carry the same deontic force as assessments of agential competence, just as assessments of the functioning of an organ like the heart or liver do not carry the same deontic force as assessments of agential competence. Deontic assessments concern not what hand you're dealt by your information-processing systems, but rather what you choose to do with the hand you're dealt.
But this analogy between one's information-processing systems and the card dealer raises a question that goes to the heart of Sosa's project in this book. How, precisely, should we understand the contrast between the freely chosen endeavor of an agent, on the one hand, and the performance of a teleologically guided sub-agential capacity, on the other? The difference is not merely a matter of their degree of complexity since some teleologically guided sub-agential capacities may be extremely complex and contain many other teleologically guided sub-agential capacities within them. Sosa may label this difference in various ways: as a difference in whether the performances are freely chosen by the performer, as a difference in whether the performer is an agent, as a difference in whether the performer is responsible for the performance, as a difference in whether assessments of the performance carry deontic force, and so on. All these labels travel together, but can we say what these labels amount to without moving around in the same small circle of labels? In short, can we explain agency?
Notice that there is nothing reductive about this demand. Perhaps agency cannot be reduced to non-agential terms. But even if this is the case, we might still be able to explain agency in structural terms, by specifying a causal or normative structure in agency that is not present in the operation of non-agential systems or mechanisms. But this is precisely what we do not find in Sosa's book. Mechanisms, like agents, engage in performances, and these performances are assessable along the dimensions of accuracy, adroitness, and aptness. For all that Sosa says, the difference between agents and mechanisms is not a structural difference. But it is, Sosa insists, a difference in their freedom, their responsibility, their agency, their fitness for deontic assessment. And my question for Sosa is: what precisely is added by these latter descriptions? In what way are judges not merely large-scale information-processing systems?
I believe that there is a way to answer this question, but I do not see anywhere in Sosa's book the resources necessary to implement my own preferred way of explaining agency. And so I conclude with the hope that Sosa's next book will address this fundamental question.