This book offers a valuable and provocative contribution to the growing literature on Nietzsche's political philosophy. It invites us to understand Nietzsche's politics as consisting mainly in a kind of political program calling for a radical transformation of our earthly habitation. On Shapiro's reading, this program principally requires reconceiving our relation to temporality, and, in particular, to the future, by cultivating a kind of openness that can make us receptive to those rare opportunities for radical change Nietzsche called "great events". Nietzsche's politics of futurity, however, requires displacing the way of thinking prevalent in the petty politics of nation-states. In each chapter, Shapiro investigates different aspects of Nietzsche's critiques of this way of thinking, trying to articulate, at the same time, its positive alternative.
In the introductory chapter, Shapiro argues that "earth" is a political concept that Nietzsche meant to counterpose to the Hegelian notion of "world", which has politico-theological affiliations with pernicious notions of unity and eternity, and is implicated with a teleological metanarrative of the end of history that overly extols the nation-state as the medium for the world-spirit's self-realization (pp.4, 7, 11-13, 16). According to Shapiro, Nietzsche sought to combat these entrenched political notions by initiating a great politics of the earth that, in contrast to the homogenizing world of nation-states, entreats us to see our planet as a place of radical plurality and of mobile multitudes that can dedicate themselves to giving a new direction to the earth (p.5, 18). Shapiro is aware that the dichotomy of "earth" vs. "world" may be suspect, insofar as the contrast is not one Nietzsche appears to have made explicit in his texts. Still, he argues (in my view credibly) that the distinction illuminates important themes in Nietzsche's work and that, in a way, it is implicit from the beginning in all of Nietzsche's philosophizing.
Chapter 2 picks up the anti-metanarrative theme by focusing on early Nietzsche's invective against end of history thinking. Shapiro emphasizes the way in which, for Nietzsche, this kind of thinking is implicated with a racist ideology of national unity that devalues the exceptional human being in favor of the uniform, homogeneous masses of the nation-state (pp.29, 32). This association is partly explained by the fact that state thinking displays a tendency to draw borders and posits an exclusionary dichotomy, in which the reasonably regulated life of those living within the state is to be contrasted with the chaotic barbarism encountered outside (pp.50-51). To sustain this kind of ideology, the state exploits the journalistic conception of events understood as "news", i.e. as something that must be perpetually expected and feared, which, among other things, facilitates the manufacturing of permanent "states of exception" through which the hold on power of the money-makers and military despots that control the state is strengthened, with the excuse that it is the only way to handle the constant siege that the state is under (pp.46-47, 67-68). According to Shapiro, Nietzsche in his early writings, aiming to disrupt this network of statist ideas, tried to articulate a conception of "great events" as unpredictable and transformative occurrences that instead of foreclosing the future can throw it open. But his attempt failed because he was still caught up with problematic notions of national unity and even with Hegelian modes of thinking (pp.36-37, 56-57).
Chapter 3 begins with a look at "states of exception" which, on Shapiro's analysis, Nietzsche saw as symptoms of the fragility of the modern state (pp.65-66). The nation-state requires the use of devices to suspend the rule of law in part because the increased mobility of populations and the growing cultural intermingling of Europeans are eroding the authority of the state and threatening to abolish it altogether. Much of the chapter, however, is devoted to a very hard to follow discussion of techniques of measurement and control of people, processes of territorialization, deterritorialization, and reterritorialization that organize the way we think of our relation to space and earth, the relation between music and geography, and so on. As happens in other places, this discussion, while insightful, is a bit disorganized, with abrupt changes in focus and the development of lines of thought whose connection to an overarching thesis is not always discernible. Still, perhaps the connecting thread is to be found in Shapiro's attempt to articulate what he takes to be Nietzsche's way of exploring other alternatives for inhabiting the earth and overcoming the pernicious essentialism of the nation-state that stifles the spirit of a people. Shapiro argues that Nietzsche saw populations, not as masses to be molded into systematic and homogeneous forms, but as multitudes full of productive possibilities precisely because they constitute experiments in inhabiting the earth, ones that require mobility in the form of nomadic wanderings, migrations, and also climatic and environmental changes in order to be fecund (pp.91, 93). Out of these multitudes are born the hybrid humans that anticipate the European of the future by trying out different cultural combinations and syntheses (p.97).
Chapter 4 returns to the theme of great events, this time highlighting their nature as kairos or moments of opportunity to be seized at the right juncture. Shapiro argues that a key aspect of nobility, as Nietzsche understood it, consists in "a mode of living one's temporality involving alert vigilance, freedom from the crowd's enthusiasms of the moment, and from the deadly deformation of lived time through economies of debt that mortgage the future" (p.102). In order to seize the opportune moment, the noble type must think beyond peoples and fatherlands, thus implicating him with the desire to see Europe become one by experimenting with new cosmopolitan forms of diversity and multiplicity that extend beyond borderlines (pp.109-110, 116). Similarly, cultivating this type of nobility will require escaping the logic of mortgage time that governs nation-states, where personal and political time are subjected to a regime of debt and credit that forces us to experience life in the temporal mode of chronos, i.e. as a series of stretches of time measured in terms of conditions of repayments of debts and of penalties for defaulting that all militate against our ability to seize the kairos (p.130-131).
In chapter 5, Shapiro investigates the place of the garden metaphor in Nietzsche's politics. It includes a fascinating discussion of the historic role that the concept of the garden has played in the formation of modern aesthetics (pp.140-151). Shapiro has a very general statement regarding the garden as a space to promote a hedonistic happiness in which "the dominant themes are the shaping and tending of the natural, with a view to producing a rewarding result as well as the enjoyment of an earthly site" (pp.150-151). However, he fails to connect his rich analysis more forcefully with Nietzsche's use of the metaphor. This missed opportunity is unfortunate, for Shapiro touches on themes that are very much at play in Nietzsche's philosophy. For instance, Shapiro notes that the Italian and French styles of gardening that Nietzsche admired were designed to highlight the sovereignty of the human will over nature, its ability to master and civilize natural forces in order to subordinate them to some grand rational plan. And while, in fairness, it should be said that Shapiro does claim that the Nietzschean garden metaphor stresses the power of shaping, framing, and making (p.156), and that it even incorporates the idea of the garden as the work of reason on behalf of reason (p.162), the overall tendency of Shapiro's account is to foreclose the possible connection that these notions might have, in Nietzsche philosophy, to more grandiose conceptions of the human will and its capacity to plan the future with world-conquering and eternalizing ambitions. Such connections would, of course, run counter to the general picture of Nietzsche's politics Shapiro is determined to draw, in which supposedly the future of the earth cannot be planned (pp.98-99). Yet, it seems to me that such themes are very much part of Nietzsche's philosophy, as seen, for instance, in the important section GS 291 that Shapiro himself brings to our attention. For Nietzsche, the garden is not just the product of an experimental reason, as Shapiro would have it (p.161), but also of an eternalizing, totalizing, perhaps -- forgive the contrived formula -- even of a metanarrativizing reason. The Genoa builders of GS 291, after all, "built and adorned to last for centuries and not for the fleeting hour" and they "perpetrated acts of violence and conquest" with their designs, that had the grand ambition of laying hands to the whole world around them in order to "make it [their] possession by incorporating it into [their] plan". Here is one of the places where the real weak spot of Shapiro's otherwise insightful analysis is exposed most clearly, a point to which I will return shortly.
In the last chapter, Shapiro turns to Nietzsche's philosophy of the Antichrist by examining the infamous book that bears that name in its title. For Shapiro, one of the principal lessons of The Antichrist is that Christianity is Paul's political invention, through which the early Christian interpretation of the Jesus event was subverted in order to accommodate the fact that the apocalyptic expectations of the faith had been disappointed (pp.175, 186-187). A religion that started out as rigorously unworldly had to learn to adapt itself to a world that stubbornly continued to persist. This political adjustment involved, above all, developing a new theory of time in which history became plotted as a story of deferred redemption through the intervention of Church and State, whose worldly powers ward off the imminent coming of the Antichrist (pp.195-196). Since, according to Shapiro, the metanarrative of world-history is one of the chief elements of statist ideology, he argues that Christianity is the inventor of world-history and that The Antichrist is integral to Nietzsche's attempt to overcome this way of reckoning time that belittles humanity and the earth (pp.180-181). How the reformed Christian story of deferred redemption through the state transmutes itself into a story of fulfilled redemption in the state is something that Shapiro does not fully explain. On his account, Christianity lends ideological support to imperial authority partly by fomenting the belief that the state is the restraining force that can keep the Antichrist from appearing and history and the world from ending (p.186). Yet, part of statist ideology is also to suppose that the state will bring about the end of history, and these two functions, as restrainer and enabler of the end of time, do not seem compatible at first glance. Perhaps the answer to this apparent contradiction is obvious to Shapiro, but, in general, these kinds of unresolved tensions abound in his analysis.
Overall, Nietzsche's Earth is very interesting and provocative; it strives with no small measure of success to provide a coherent picture of Nietzsche's philosophy. Shapiro does a good job of showing the relevance of Nietzsche's thought to contemporary social and political issues like the war on terror, globalization, the environmental crisis, and so on. He is to be commended especially also for his ability to engage fearlessly with Nietzsche's metaphors, which are an essential part of his thinking, and yet are often neglected by many Anglophone commentators, particularly those working within the analytic tradition. To them, this book may serve as a lesson and an example of the kinds of rewards that could await those who dare to follow the thread that leads into Nietzsche's symbolic universe. In this regard, I think that Shapiro has benefitted well from the continental tradition he draws from, which has fewer qualms about engaging in metaphoric analysis.
But the root of Shapiro's strength may also be the source of his weakness. For one thing, readers who are not conversant with the philosophical perspectives of writers like Deleuze, Guattari, and Agamben will have a hard time following the discussions where these figures are recruited in order to explain important themes in Nietzsche's philosophy. Shapiro often forgets to take the time to help readers clearly understand the conceptual resources he deploys, leaving us to fend for ourselves and to resolve the apparent tensions introduced by the use of these resources. How is it that statist ideology, whose tendency supposedly inclines towards an entrenched mentality of drawing borders, is not, as one would have perhaps naturally expected, associated with the thought-process of "territorialization" by means of which "we humans (and all living things) . . . [stake] out a space, a place . . . we mark the borders of our situation" (p.85), but is instead linked to "deterritorializing" forms of thinking in which spaces are being absorbed in a kind of expansionist mindset that, disrespecting all borders, attempts to "[configure] itself as a mobile political structure, not absolutely tied to a fixed place" (p.86)? How is it that the network of statist ideas that includes the notion of the "end of history" according to which no more new events are to be expected because time has ceased, nonetheless, also includes the journalistic conception of events as "news" that must constantly be manufactured because the state cannot tolerate empty time?
As I mentioned, it may be that the solution to these and other tensions is not so difficult, but Shapiro does not even seem to notice their presence in his account. Indeed, as I read this book, I often found myself feeling as if I had stepped into the middle of a veritable lighting storm of very suggestive insights, but absent the metal rod and the lens that could harness these flashes and concentrate them into a tightly focused beam. As a result, I cannot help but feel that, while generally coherent and capturing much that I believe to be really part of Nietzsche's philosophy, the Nietzschean tapestry that Shapiro has woven threatens to fall apart at the seams. It also provides a skewed and partial picture that omits important themes that, in many ways, are more central to Nietzsche's philosophical outlook and, thus, presumably integral to whatever political project he may have espoused. I have no doubt that, as Shapiro insists, Nietzsche's politics of futurity does entreat us to keep to some extent the future open, to cultivate nomadic lives and ways of thinking that are free from the stifling effects of nationalistic ideology, to resist the pernicious influence of the multitude's passing enthusiasms and the theatrical sensationalism of the modern press, so that we can seize the kairos; and so on.
But where, in this vision, is the Nietzsche who showed admiration for the laws of Manu, "whose goal was to 'eternalize' the supreme condition for a thriving life" (A 58)? Or the Nietzsche who laments the Christian destruction of the Roman Empire because "this most remarkable artwork in the great style was a beginning, its design was calculated to prove itself over the millennia -- , nothing like it has been built to this day, nobody has even dreamed of building on this scale, sub specie aeterni [from the standpoint of eternity]!" (A 60). Where, indeed, is the Nietzsche who, as Shapiro has it, may criticize the logic of mortgage time, but also has no problem incorporating that very logic into his own -- dare I say -- teleological metanarrative of redemption in The Genealogy, by appearing to suggest that the human being with the right to make promises, the sovereign individual who is the master of a free will, might be, in turn, the great promise that nature makes to us as repayment, perhaps, for the guilt it has incurred in using us for its bloody and cruel experiment of cultivating that great tree of humanity that we are to find in the recovered garden-earth Shapiro speaks of (GM II.2-3, 16)? A great promise and a debt, by the way, that in an interesting reversal of the Christian story might require our assistance to be repaid (for instance, by our learning to incorporate the thought of Eternal Recurrence into our lives); for nature is blind, and the god of nature, Dionysus, might be incapable of securing on his own the conditions that will ensure that we are able to enjoy -- as does the convalescent Zarathustra in his post-redemption speech -- the pleasant smell of the rosy apple of our volitional powers instead of the repulsive, sinful scent of a rotting free will that has spoiled on the tree (BGE 203, 211; Z III 'The Convalescent', 2).
It is not altogether surprising that Shapiro has a blind spot for these themes, for they tend to clash with those favored by the type of philosophic tradition in which he feels at home, and for which this kind of eternalizing metanarrative is part of the problem. Nietzsche often speaks positively of tradition. Its tyrannical hold can serve to educate the spirit in self-discipline and prepare it for freedom (BGE 44, 188). The will to tradition is also, for him, part of the engine that drives those powers, like the Roman Empire, "that can wait, that can still make promises", for this will belongs to "the sort of instincts that give rise to institutions, that give rise to a future" (TI 'Skirmishes', 39). But in his characteristic nuanced way, Nietzsche also warns us against becoming so comfortable within our traditions that we simply let our thoughts grow peacefully, all too peacefully from them (UM III.8). One of the things he admired in our modern culture was precisely its ability to contradict and to be hostile towards what is traditional; the ability to take sides against all that is familiar and wants to become firm in us (GS 296, 297).
None of us can completely escape the influence of our preferred traditions. But remembering to remain vigilant of the ways in which they might skew our outlooks might perhaps be one of the most important lessons I am bringing back home with me from my fortunate encounter with Shapiro's thought-provoking work.
REFERENCES
Nietzsche, Friedrich. (1997 [1873-6]), Untimely Meditations (UM), D. Breazeale (ed.) and R.J. Hollingdale (trans.). Cambridge University Press.
-- (2001 [1882 and 1887 (Book V added)]), The Gay Science: with a Prelude in German Rhymes and an Appendix of Songs (GS), B. Williams (ed.), and J. Nauckhoff and A. Del Caro (trans.). Cambridge University Press.
-- (2002 [1886]), Beyond Good and Evil (BGE), R.P. Horstmann and J. Norman (eds.), and J. Norman (trans.). Cambridge University Press.
-- (2005 [1888]), The Anti-Christ, Ecce Homo, Twilight of the Idols and Other Writings (A, EH, and TI, respectively), A. Ridley and J. Norman (eds.), and J. Norman (trans.). Cambridge University Press.
-- (2006 [1887]), On the Genealogy of Morality (GM), K. Ansell-Pearson (ed.) and C. Diethe (trans.). Cambridge University Press.
-- (2006 [1883-5]), Thus Spoke Zarathustra (Z), R. Pippin (ed.) and A. Del Caro (trans.). Cambridge University Press.