This book is a valuable contribution to the rapidly growing field of Japanese philosophy. A nicely produced anthology, it includes a thoughtful introduction by the editor, Michiko Yusa, fourteen erudite essays subdivided into five sections, plus a convenient summary of the essays, notes on the contributors, an account of abbreviations and conventions, an appendix including two essays by Nishida Kitarō, a timeline with dates for the thinkers discussed, an index of Japanese texts cited, and a more traditional index, including kanji, of names and terms mentioned in the anthology. Overall, the scholarly apparatuses included make this volume an extraordinarily well-organized and helpful resource for those conducting scholarly explorations of Japanese philosophy.
Michiko Yusa's introduction contextualizes the anthology in relation to recent scholarship in the field. In particular, the introduction notes the recent publication of a "monumental work," Japanese Philosophy: A Sourcebook, (JPS), edited by James W. Heisig, Thomas P. Kasulis, and John C. Maraldo. The Sourcebook is cast in grandiose terms as a "watershed for the field of Japanese philosophy . . . which irrevocably altered the academic perception of Japanese philosophy." In addition to the Sourcebook, the introduction notes other new and forthcoming anthologies including the Oxford Handbook of Japanese Philosophy, edited by Bret Davis; Dao Companion to Japanese Buddhist Philosophy, edited by Gereon Kopf; and Globalizing Japanese Philosophy as an Academic Discipline, edited by Ching-yuen Cheung and Wing-keung Lam. The introduction also notes the work of two new philosophical associations, the International Association of Japanese Philosophy (IAJP) and the European Network of Japanese Philosophy (ENJP), "each with its own journal to publish works in Japanese philosophy and related fields" (Yusa 2017: 1). On this count, it is noteworthy that the Journal of Japanese Philosophy, published by the IAJP, has made outstanding and ongoing contributions to the field.
Also worth mentioning in this context -- though overlooked in Yusa's introduction -- is Dao Companion to Japanese Confucian Philosophy (2014), which I edited with Chun-chieh Huang. Moreover, work issuing from the University of Tokyo Center for Philosophy (in the form of occasional booklets, online publications, seminars, and conferences) has contributed significantly to the emergence of the field with indigenous integrity and the highest degree of academic respectability. Collectively, these anthologies, journals, and sourcebooks reflect, without hyperbole, an international boom in the field of Japanese philosophy. The volume under review adds to the explosion in publications, maintaining the impressive momentum attained even while affirming high standards for scholarly analysis and content.
The anthology, while contextualized in relation to a host of other developments, offers a self-characterization formulated somewhat in relation to JPS. Yusa's introduction states that the anthology "showcases philosophical discourses currently taking place in and outside Japan, with the hope of building a bridge from 'both sides' -- from the Western and Japanese side" (1). In contrast, the introduction notes that "the JPS editors'" accounts of their project, "nuanced and sensitive to interculturality as they are, are made from the vantage point of 'outside Japan' in their effort to recognize the 'modes of critical thinking and self-understanding' that may be found in Japanese thinking." Alternatively, Yusa emphasizes, "to balance out the methodological movement, the present Bloomsbury volume contains works that suggest an approach 'from within Japan'" (4). On this count, the anthology should surely be lauded for bringing together an assemblage of scholarship produced by Japanese, North Americans, Chinese, and Europeans, a global array of voices and perspectives that contribute fascinating perspectives to the subject of Japanese philosophy and philosophizing generally. Hopefully the more global authorship paradigm this volume well exemplifies might come to prevail increasingly in future scholarship on Japanese philosophy and the humanities generally.
The book's five sections are of varying depth and complexity. The opening section, "Making of Modern Japanese Philosophy," seems both promising and yet, then again, somewhat lacking. One might expect to find some consideration of the ways in which the field came to emerge, historically and developmentally, over the last century or so in Japan and Asia, and in the last several decades in the remainder of the world. Instead, the subtitle to the section clarifies its content: "Phenomenology as a Case in Point." Keiichi Noe's fine "Phenomenology in Japan: Its Inception and Blossoming" is a fascinating study, but stands alone in relation to the seemingly larger section division of which it is a part. One wonders why the section was not simply entitled "Phenomenology in Japan" instead. Moreover, since this section is the thinnest in terms of essays comprising it, one wonders why it was designated as the anthology's lead section. The sections that follow, each with two or more essays, are much fuller and more faithful to their section titles.
The second section, "Social and Political Themes," includes four very provocative essays. The first, Takahiro Nakajima's "Confucianism in Modern Japan," is the only essay in the entire book that focuses specifically on Japanese Confucianism and its legacy in modern, contemporary Japan. Nakajima's essay covers, admittedly, considerable ground in casting Confucianism as a philosophical teaching that was used to mold modern Japanese into good citizens and loyal subjects. Yet the section, as well as the anthology as a whole, might have benefited from more effort in examining the extent to which Confucianism, as a key traditional philosophical force, provided foundations and inspiration for much of the philosophy produced in twentieth century Japan. The legacies of Buddhism are considered at every turn, but with the exception of Nakajima's essay, the short shrift is surely given to Confucianism. One would hope that educated readers will recognize this not as a reflection of the relatively minor importance of Confucianism in relation to contemporary Japanese philosophy, but instead as a weakness in the field as a whole in terms of training, scholarly production, and inclusion in even the most multicultural academic ventures such as this. Confucianism in Japan was, after all, a colossal force in the development of Japanese philosophy, as Inoue Tetsujirō readily recognized very early on in his studies of the three schools of Confucian philosophy in Japan, the Zhu Xi School, the Wang Yangming School, and the Ancient Learning School. Yet in modern, and especially Western studies of Japanese philosophy, one would scarcely know that Confucianism and studies of Confucian philosophy had had much, if anything, positive to offer the unfolding of philosophy as an academic and intellectual discipline in Japan. The present anthology does little, apart from Nakajima's useful essay, to provide a better accounting of discipline in relation to Confucianism, despite the clear importance of the latter to it at one level or another.
The other three essays in the second section include Kenn Nakata Steffensen's "The Political Thought of the Kyoto School: Beyond 'Questionable Footnotes' and 'Japanese-Style Fascism,'" Nobuo Kazashi's "Metanoetics for the Dead and the Living: Tanabe Hajime, Karaki Junzō, and Moritaki Ichirō on the Nuclear Age," and Cheung Ching-yuen's "In the Wake of 3.11 Earthquake: Philosophy of Disaster and Pilgrimage." Each of these make an impressive contribution to discussions of Japanese philosophy, without a doubt, but overall, they also indicate the majority focus of the anthology, that of the Kyoto School. The latter is surely important for any study of Japanese philosophy, contemporary or otherwise, but readers will quickly appreciate the extent to which it, in one way or another, constitutes a thematic majority presence throughout the volume.
The third section, "Aesthetics," includes Michael F. Marra's "The Aesthetics of Tradition: Making the Past Present," Enrico Fongaro's "Bodily Present Activity in History: An Artistic Streak in Nishida Kitarō's Thought," and Raquel Bouso Garcia's "In Search of an Aesthetics of Emptiness: Two European Thinkers." Without meaning to disparage any of these, again the prominence of the Kyoto School in their discussions and throughout the anthology perhaps prompts one to wonder whether the Kyoto School really constitutes such a presence in contemporary Japanese philosophy, or instead the professional orientations of those specializing in the latter.
The fourth section, "Some Prominent Twentieth-Century Thinkers," includes Steve Bein's "Watsuji Tetsurō: Accidental Buddhist?" Bret W. Davis's "Encountering Emptiness: The I-Thou Relation in Nishitani Keiji's Philosophy of Zen," John W. M. Krummel's "Creative Imagination, Sensus Communis, and the Social Imaginary: Miki Kiyoshi and Nakamura Yūjirō in Dialogue with Contemporary Western Philosophy," and Keiichi Noe's "Nishida Kitarō as a Philosopher of Science." Once again, Kyoto School themes predominate in these essays, viewed comprehensively. While each is surely an excellent study, collectively they, and the anthology as a whole, seem to present contemporary Japanese philosophy as by and large a multifaceted expression of the Kyoto School. One can't but question whether this is a one-sided take on what was, is, and will remain a much more complex and multifaceted field of philosophical discourse.
The fifth section, "Philosophical Dialogue on Gender and Life," includes Erin A. McCarthy's "Japanese and Western Feminist Philosophies: A Dialogue" and Michiko Yusa's "Affirmation via Negation: Zen Philosophy of Life, Sexual Desire, and Infinite Love." The prominence given to Hiratsuka Raichō's thought in these essays is undoubtedly appropriate, yet even Raichō's thinking is cast in relation to Zen Buddhism and akin to that of Nishida and the Kyoto School. A more complete picture, it seems, might have been provided by an exploration of "traditional" themes relating to gender issues as found in works such as Bernard Faure's The Power of Denial: Buddhism, Purity and Gender (Princeton, 2003), where Buddhist conceptions, and much that is "traditional" to East Asia, are characterized as misogynistic, though not irredeemably so. A similar estimation of Confucian and Neo-Confucian thinking about gender might be offered, drawing on works such as Great Learning for Women (Onna daigaku), a text that, despite its distance from contemporary mores, once made a stand for the sake of female education and enlightenment within an otherwise unrelentingly patriarchal system. This sort of historical contextualization of the contemporary seems very much in order, and quite necessary for a balanced study of the compelling issues otherwise so admirably examined in this anthology. The appendix, "Two Essays by Nishida Kitarō," presents Nishida's "The Beauty of Calligraphy" (Sho no bi) and his "On Japanese Short Poetry, Tanka" (Tanka ni tsuite), with the Japanese text printed in a column to the left of the English translation. These translations of two of Nishida's briefer writings add value to the anthology as a whole even as they once again reveal the decided leaning of the volume as a whole toward the Kyoto School in its many forms.
These points aside, there can be no question that this volume deserves a place in the library of anyone specializing in Japanese philosophy, alongside the earlier mentioned JPS and the various anthologies currently or soon to be in print. There can be little doubt that the last several decades have witnessed the coming of age of Japanese philosophy, especially as articulated and studied on a global scale. The Bloomsbury Research Handbook of Contemporary Japanese Philosophy makes an especially valuable contribution in underscoring, through its essays hailing from the various corners of the globe, the international intellectual and practical phenomenon that the field of Japanese philosophy has become. The editor and contributors deserve the thanks of their colleagues in this exciting, burgeoning field as well as those of parties globally fascinated by these developments.