The Philosophy of Richard Rorty

The Philosophy of Richard Rorty is the thirty-second volume in the Library of Living Philosophers series, which commenced with a volume on the philosopher with whom Rorty is most often compared, John Dewey. With this volume, the series title serves as a sad reminder of Rorty's death at the age of 75 in 2007, while the collection was still in preparation. For many who, like the reviewer, were in the early stages of a university career in philosophy at the time, the publication of Rorty's Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature in 1979 was a very significant event indeed.^[1] I imagine that the attitude towards Rorty expressed by James Edwards in his contribution to the volume is far from unusual: "I am one of those who admire the work (and the man) almost without reservation; one of those who would not want to imagine what recent … philosophy would have been if Rorty had not been around to shake things up and to forge some unexpected linkages" (658).^[2] Of course not everyone, even from that particular generation, reacted to this work, and the stream of writings following it, with admiration. While many saw in Rorty a Socratic gadfly, to another wing of the profession he was closer to an ancient sophist. And even among those who do admire, admiration rarely means whole-hearted agreement -- many admirers still find troubling elements within Rorty's philosophy, as Edwards himself seems to.

With Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature and the series of collections of essays that started with Consequence of Pragmatism in 1982,^[3] Rorty's thought-provoking ideas began to find a wide readership beyond the bounds of professional philosophy and started to attract the combination of applause and condemnation that has continued to this day. In fact, collections of critical essays on Rorty, similar in conception and format to the Library of Living Philosophers series, have been appearing on a reasonably regular basis since Alan Malachowski's Reading Rorty in 1990.^[4] Even omitting non-English language volumes and ones with very specific themes, such as one on "Rorty and Confucianism", there have been, on my count, seven prior to this volume. Of these, a number, like the Malachowski volume, have followed the LLP practice of having paired replies by Rorty to the interpretative and critical pieces. Both Malachowski's collection and the impressive 2000 volume edited by Robert Brandom, Rorty and His Critics,^[5] while large at around 400 pages each, are dwarfed by the LLP volume. With the standard introductory "Intellectual Autobiography", twenty-nine substantial essays, most with replies by Rorty, and an extensive bibliography of Rorty's writings, it is roughly the size of the other two combined.

So much has already been written about the philosophy of Richard Rorty that one might wonder whether there will be much new left to say. But while it is true that many of the general themes invoked in the essays in this book have a familiar ring, the majority of contributors manage to find new and illuminating ways of articulating their senses of agreement and disagreement to make it a very worthwhile addition to the literature. And as always, Rorty's replies are masterly in their ability to articulate economically the conceptual structure of the issues under dispute and, typically, to defuse criticisms by questioning distinctions presupposed by them. That there are still avenues of Rorty's thought to explore and take issue with might alone be taken as testifying to the breadth as well as the richly inventive nature of his philosophizing.

Clearly then, Rorty has been an eminently discussible as well as criticizable philosopher, and one of the reasons for this seems to lie in the fact that since the eighties he has been regarded as a philosopher who, emerging from the heartland of the fast-professionalizing world of American analytic philosophy -- the philosophy department at Princeton -- started to write about and engage with what he calls the "line of thought that leads from Hegel through Kierkegaard and Nietzsche to Heidegger and Derrida" (13) -- a line of thought clearly outside the bounds of philosophy to many within the analytic tradition. In the late sixties and early seventies, Rorty might have appeared to the casual observer as a philosopher working centrally within the type of analytic philosophy represented by the Princeton department -- a mode of philosophy that was to shape the image of what professionalized Anglophone philosophy would become during the next decades. For example, he was anthologized as the advocate of a radical "eliminative materialist" position within the early philosophy of mind and had edited a volume on analytic method, The Linguistic Turn.^[6] But from the autobiographical essay with which the volume commences one gets an interesting overview of his early years. Thus he describes his first years at Princeton, where he started as a junior academic in 1960, as ones in which he felt the need "to speak to some of the issues with which [his colleagues] were concerned and to write in somewhat the same vein as they did" (11). The reception of some of this work "made [him] feel that perhaps [he] had a future in the analytic philosophy business" (11), but in the course of putting together The Linguistic Turn, in particular, and in "figuring out what Carnap and Wittgenstein agreed about, the better to highlight their obvious differences", he bolstered his "own preference for Wittgensteinian dissolutions of philosophical problems over constructive solutions" (12), preferences that had also been acquired by his earlier immersion in the pragmatists. And in the course of the seventies, as he tells it, he was struck

by the fact that Wittgenstein's debunking approach to philosophical problems could as easily be applied to what my Princeton colleagues thought of as the 'principal problems of analytic philosophy' as to the problems of the metaphysicians at whom Ayer had jeered.

"Both sets of problems", he had begun to think, "were equally artificial". This then led him "to construct a historical narrative about the development of modern philosophy designed to support Wittgenstein's suggestion that philosophical problems were just cul-de-sacs down which philosophers had wandered" (12-3). The result was Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature.

On its appearance, many analytic philosophers responded to this work as a betrayal by one of their own, some seeing it as a cynical courting of the emerging "post-modernism" that seemed to be taking over the humanities. But as Rorty tells it, he had already acquired "a taste for ambitious, swooshy, Geistesgeschichte" (6) in his undergraduate years at the Richard McKeon-dominated department at the University of Chicago, and on going to Yale, where he did his PhD, he had been at home in another analytic-lite department, where versions of absolute idealism were still defended along with attempts to synthesize Whitehead and Hegel. A quick survey of the 1960s section of Rorty's bibliography reveals how his more standardly "analytic" publications were interspersed with articles and reviews devoted to traditional pragmatism as well as thinkers like Blanshard, Hartshorne and Weiss, his erstwhile teachers. Against this background it is easy to see how the more "professional" analytic concerns that were then developing at Princeton could become fodder for an historicizing approach to philosophy that had predated any serious engagement with developments in analysis. But Rorty's pre-analytic stance now became importantly modified by his assimilation of "what Carnap and [the latter] Wittgenstein agreed about", giving his thought its familiar "debunking" stamp.

It was this early attraction to Hegel and "swooshy" grand tellings of the history of philosophy that allowed Rorty in the seventies to massage into his ongoing narrative, in a seemingly effortless way, philosophical voices new to the Anglophone scene such as those of the late Heidegger, Hans-Georg Gadamer and Jacques Derrida, creating the sorts of "unexpected linkages" to which Edwards refers. And yet this is not enough to capture just those features of Rorty's philosophizing that makes him such a fascinating, discussible and objection-attracting figure. Others were reacting against what they took to be the narrowness of the type of emerging professionalized philosophy, with its focus on technical semantic problems, that Rorty complained about at Princeton. Thus "continental philosophy" was splitting away to accommodate types of philosophy that had always been at best marginal to the analytic movement, while some analytic philosophers such as Hilary Putnam and Stanley Cavell were going in purportedly "post-analytic" directions. But neither of these movements shared Rorty's resolutely debunking attitude to the tradition of philosophy itself. Crudely, it might be said that these movements tended to advocate that there was more to philosophy than what was perceived as the narrow technical issues that were coming to define the discipline, but for Rorty there was little worth saving from the "Plato-Kant tradition" that analytic philosophy had displaced. That is, it must be remembered that Rorty's objections to professionalized philosophy Princeton-style were themselves an extension of the objections of the early analytic positivists to the "Plato-Kant tradition" itself.

This meant that while Rorty in Philosophy and the Mirror of Nature could compare his "conversational" historicism with the type of Hegel- and Heidegger-inspired "dialogical" historicism of Hans-Georg Gadamer, Rorty's debunking attitude to philosophy was not that of Heidegger nor philosophers inspired by him. For Heidegger, as Peter Dews makes clear in his essay, freedom from the sorts of linguistic enchantments expressed in the metaphysics from which Wittgenstein (and following him, Rorty) sought to liberate thought was

not so much the driving force, as itself an expression of a fateful failure to respect the 'ontological difference' between 'Being' and 'beings'. For Rorty, by contrast, however innovative and insightful a metaphysician may have been in his own day, his ideas no longer carry any live charge; metaphysical theories have ceased to address the problems with which we are concerned, even obliquely (637).

In short, Rorty's attitude to traditional philosophy had more in common with the views of Carnap than his bête noir, Heidegger.

In her contribution Susan James rightly attributes Rorty's vast influence to the "scope and grandeur" of his philosophy, "so rich in thought-provoking asides and quickly sketched connections" (415). But I suggest that the set of features alluded to above has also contributed to Rorty's peculiar status within intellectual life and has prompted the particular combinations of agreement and disagreement that can be seen to play out within the essays in this and other similar volumes. Thus, many of the authors here start from a reasonably-to-strongly sympathetic position but quickly come to what has been bothering them in Rorty's particular approach to this or that topic. What one tends to find here are critics intent on getting more truth out of philosophy than Rorty is willing to allow, even if they are in agreement with his critique of a model of philosophical knowledge that aims at some divinely eternal over-view.

The essays here are divided up into four sections: "Pragmatism Old and New", with essays by Cheryl Misak, James W. Allard, Harvey Cormier, Jacquelyn Ann K. Kegley, Robert Cummings Neville, Jean-Pierre Cometti, Aldo Giorgio Gargani, and María Pía Lara; "The World Well Lost: Language Representation, and Truth" with Jaroslav Peregrin, János Boros, Huw Price, Yasuhiko Tomida, Albrecht Wellmer, Michael P. Lynch, David Detmer and Andrzej Szahaj; "Conversation Stoppers: Politics, Progress, and Hope" with Susan James, Richard A. Posner, Yong Huang, J. B. Schneewind, William L. McBride and Jeffrey Stout; and "A Kind of Writing: Edifying Conversations" with Raymond D. Boisvert, Gianni Vattimo, Jolán Orbán, Pascal Engel, Miguel Tamen, Peter Dews and James C. Edwards. The borders between these groupings are understandably very porous with common themes crossing the boundaries. It is impossible, of course, in even a long review to do justice to individual essays and to Rorty's replies, or even survey all of them. In the remainder of this review I will focus on two or three representatives from each of the sections, although not necessarily in their particular order, in an attempt to give an impression of the sorts of issues raised and pursued throughout this volume.

Rorty is often cited as the most influential figure in the recent revival of interest in American pragmatist philosophy and, as one might expect, the essays in Section I tend to compare the sort of pragmatism revitalized by him in the wake of figures such as Sellars, Quine and Davidson with classical pragmatism and the idealist philosophy from which it emerged. Of the classical pragmatists it is to the work of James and, especially, Dewey that Rorty mostly appeals. In the course of his essay from Section III, and drawing on the work of Robert Brandom, Stout gives a nice thumb-nail sketch of the particularly Deweyan dimension to Rorty's pragmatism. At the heart of this position is "the social-practical conception of norms that the classical pragmatists took over from Hegel" (540). Rorty's way of understanding this is to see the source of such norms as "social agreement among human beings" and it is this that ties his pragmatism into his political advocacy of Deweyan democracy and Millian liberalism. To understand that we are the ultimate sources of the norms according to which we think and act is to see claims by particular sections of the community to unilaterally determine those norms as dangerous attempts to dominate the rest, hidden behind a quasi-clerical pretense of access to some ultimate truth existing independently of humans. And for Rorty, as for Mill, the good community is one which maximizes the chances of individuals creating unique lives, which for Rorty implies fashioning the "vocabularies" with which they shape their outlooks and behaviors. To the extent that traditional philosophy seeks a source for norms in something other than human agreement, it is to be regarded as just an extension of religion. In short, to see our ideas or language as trying to represent something essentially independent from us -- seeing philosophical knowledge as ideally a "mirror of nature" -- is just another instance of thinking of ourselves as responsible to something other than other human beings.

A number of papers attempt to bring out features and shortcomings of Rorty's brand of pragmatism by usefully comparing him to earlier figures. In "Idealism, Pragmatism and the World Well Lost", Allard insightfully compares Rorty to the nineteenth-century Scottish idealist Edward Caird, seeing both as responding to the "broken harmony of spiritual life" in their own times. Caird had been concerned to reconcile science with religion, while for Rorty the analogous task is to somehow reconcile science with literary culture regarded as a provider of new vocabularies within which individuals may articulate their values, aspirations and hopes. But while Caird had appealed to idealist metaphysics to do this, Rorty, of course, rejects any metaphysical solution. Allard, however, like a number of others in the volume, is skeptical of Rorty's strategy for defending humanistic culture in the face of the sciences' perceived monopolization of truth by simply abandoning the idea that it is the function of language in any context to truly represent the world. And while Dewey had similarly protested against such a representationalist conception of language, Dewey's earlier version of pragmatism, thinks Allard, did not face potential incoherencies that Rorty's Wittgenstein/Davidson-based version of pragmatism does. In his response to Allard, Rorty clarifies how he sees the relation between his pragmatism -- which is more a form of "romanticism" -- and nineteenth-century idealism. "Like idealism, romanticism resists the claim that natural science tells us how reality really is. But romanticism does not go on to offer an alternative account" (69). And we just don't need the sorts of answers that Allard says Rorty's pragmatism cannot provide: "After we cease asking which entities are available to serve as truth makers, we can forget about metaphysics" (70).

Kegley, in "False Dichotomies and Mixed Metaphors: Genuine Individuals Need Genuine Communities", also has reservations about the capacity for Rorty to do justice to the aspirations he can be seen as sharing with earlier idealists once the metaphysical project is abandoned in its entirely, and to this end she contrasts Rorty with the American idealist Josiah Royce. Like Rorty, Royce rejected any Cartesian conception of the human subject linked to the "mirroring" conception of knowledge and stressed the idea of the self as coming to be through a type of self-interpretation. Thus she quotes Royce's claim that "my idea of myself is an interpretation of my past -- linked also with an interpretation of my hopes and intentions as to my future" (112). This is an idea that looks similar to Rorty's idea that freedom is a product of constructing narratives of the self in which one frees oneself from the way others try to pin one down in their accounts. But Royce, she thinks, has a more concrete sense of the type of community in which this type of self-creation via redescription can find a place (115). In comparison to the set of criteria Royce comes up with for the sort of genuine community in which self-creation is possible, Rorty's invocation of the ironist who merely recognizes the ultimate contingency of her values looks too thin (123-4). But Rorty replies that one's ability to identify those "anticommunities" unworthy of one's loyalty will depend on one's belonging to some other. "But what criterion should somebody raised in the bosom of the Mafia use when deciding whether to rat out her friends and relatives?" (136)

In her essay from Section III, "Politics and the Progress of Sentiments", James pursues different but linked concerns in the context of Rorty's political thought. One of Rorty's important contributions to contemporary political theory has been to revive Hume's suggestion that sees "social and political advance as a progress of sentiments" (415) and to focus on the role of "imagination, redescription, and narrative" in this process. Integral to "the capacity of more and less powerful individuals to imagine the sufferings and humiliations of others, and to conceive of better ways of life in which these deprivations are overcome" is "redescription -- the capacity to reconfigure and re-evaluate existing practices by challenging the terms in which they are normally discussed and by inventing new normative vocabularies" (416). But James questions the "excessively sharp opposition between reason and passion" which leads Rorty to minimize the role of reason here. "Rorty's emphasis on narratives", she states, "sometimes blurs the important difference between narratives about mainly imaginary states of affairs and narratives that are already realized in more or less powerful practices" (423). In his response, Rorty reemphasizes that in the light of the failure to rationally ground hope in progress, all that is available for us is a type of ungrounded "romantic, utopian hope" (430) sustained by the types of narratives to which he appeals.

The essays of section II "The World Well Lost: Language, Representation, and Truth" tend to focus on these issues in ways they have come to be discussed in contemporary analytic philosophy. Peregrin, in "Language, the World, and the Nature of Philosophy", develops a sympathetic sketch of Rorty's pragmatism while pointing to its dangers. With the claim that pragmatism is a "good servant" but "bad master", he is concerned lest pragmatism comes to be taken as an "ultimate philosophical doctrine" (226) that does more harm than good. "The point is that pragmatism is powerful only if it is entertained within the context of philosophy carried out as a cooperative enterprise". Outside this context "pragmatism merely furnishes the combatants with an extra lethal weapon: that of simply dismissing the opponent's views on the score of not being helpful or interesting" (241-2). In response Rorty enlarges on the role of theorizing within the pragmatist's practice. "Though sometimes it works best to say 'that's a bad question, one that we pragmatists don't ask', with some interlocutors it is more effective to reply, 'here's an answer to that question, since you insist on asking it'" (248). It is in such contexts that new philosophical theories, like those of Davidson and Brandom, are useful, despite the fact that they don't claim to say something about the way the world really is.

In her contribution in Section I, "Richard Rorty's Place in the Pragmatist Pantheon", Misak appeals to Peirce as an early pragmatist whose "pragmatic elucidation" of truth offers a way around problems found in William James and, by implication, Rorty, given the Jamesian quality of some of his early statements about truth. Rorty had become aware of the problems of James's definitions of truth and modified his own position by introducing a "cautionary" dimension to truth to accompany the "endorsing" view according to which we apply the term true "to all the assertions we feel justified in making, or feel others are justified in making" (38). By itself, the endorsing view seems to reduce truth to justification, but the "cautionary" use breaks this by reminding us that what we take to be justifications are likely to change in the future, the distinction between present and future justifications now preventing the collapse of truth into justification. But this, she thinks, leads to a thought that Rorty is "loathe to accept. There is something at which we aim that goes beyond what seems right to us here and now" (38). Peirce's elucidation of this idea is of truth as a belief that would remain forever justified. In his response, Rorty appeals to the Jamesian requirement that conceptual differences make a difference. He cannot see how the Peircean idea amounts to anything more than the "banal thought that we might be wrong… . The Peircean thought seems to me merely to cloak a commonplace in a metaphor (aiming at a far-off target) [that] provides no practical guidance" (45).

Misak's concerns intersect with those expressed in Lynch's contribution to Section II, "Truth and the Pathos of Distance". Lynch also rejects the type of deflationary approach to truth that Misak calls the "endorsement" view and, in ways similar to Allard, wants to defend humanistic culture by ways other than Rorty's general deflation of the notion of truth. The humanities construct narratives and offer coherent explanations that we evaluate in terms of the notion of truth, and so we need a way of capturing their capacity for truth. Rather than deflate truth, Lynch recommends that we be pluralists about truth and acknowledge that the features that make humanistic narratives truth-apt are different from those that make the natural sciences so. Rorty in reply writes that while Lynch thinks it appropriate to ask the question "what makes it true?", he doubts that "talk of truth-makers has any useful function except to instill the comforting feeling that we have, somewhere out there in the distance, an invisible friend called Reality" (364).

In his "One Cheer for Representationalism?", Price is happy to accept the deflationary approach to truth and neatly traces a path to the evisceration of the notion of representation from within analytic philosophy itself. One can extend the early positivists' "expressivist" treatments of moral claims globally with the aid of deflationary or "minimalist" treatments of truth to a type of antirepresentationalist stance akin to Rorty's. Price shares Rorty's generally Wittgenstein-Carnap approach to language, as well as his strong resistance to "metaphysics", but, parallel to Brandom, he finds more coherence among the functions of the truth predicate than Rorty or Wittgenstein allow, given the fundamental role of assertion within our language games. Brandom's position, however, threatens to lapse into a metaphysical account of representation, and so Price contrasts his own one cheer for representationalism with Rorty's none and Brandom's two. Rorty in his response doesn't see much difference between the stances of all three, but among other things Price's approach draws into question Rorty's consistent identification throughout the volume of his own position with that of Brandom, an issue to which I will return.

Boisvert, in "Richard Rorty: Philosopher of the Common Man, Almost", finds Rorty's contributions to philosophy to reside in the historicist, pluralist and anti-foundationalist ideas he so successfully spread, as well as his powerful reinterpretation of the notion of democracy. But like Peregrin and others, Boisvert is concerned about the potential for Rorty's position to transform into a non-therapeutic dualistic theorizing, noting, as had Kegley and James, the "pairs of 'either-ors'" pervading some of Rorty's texts. Rather than Rorty's "blanket rejection of 'essences'", he recommends an attitude to the idea of essence that recontextualizes "what was best about that term" (559).

Boisvert's criticism allows Rorty to expand on the significance for him of Hegel, whose historicizing approach he constantly invokes throughout the volume. What Rorty exactly recommends of Hegel's approach to philosophy is hard to pin down, as it is clearly Hegel stripped of the metaphysics with which he is usually identified. Hegel himself portrayed his philosophy as the culmination of the Plato-Kant tradition that Rorty abjures, but for Rorty he is the first name in the series that passes through Kierkegaard and Nietzsche to Heidegger and Derrida. And many of course will find Hegel an odd precedent for any approach to philosophy that can be found as common to Wittgenstein and Carnap. In his response to Price, Rorty opposes his Hegelian stance to Price's Humean one, but one might have difficulty with what this distinction could count for in Rorty. Price appeals to a type of "anthropology" as the self-image for philosophy and one might wonder if this term might not often capture Rorty's position as well, as he commonly portrays the virtues of "history" as residing primarily in the fact that it allows us to grasp the contingency of the ideas we come up with. Might not anthropology do this too?

To the differences Price finds between Rorty and Brandom, one might add their respective attitudes to Kant. For Brandom, Hegel correctly grasps the spirit of Kant, but for Rorty Hegel is Kant's antithesis. Rorty's antipathy to Kant is the focus of Boros's essay "Representationalism and Antirepresentationalism: Kant, Davidson, and Rorty", where he points to the oddness of not taking Kant as a type of proto-antirepresentationalist. In his reply, Rorty can only find value in the Critique of Pure Reason in that "by exasperating Hegel, it led him to give up on epistemology and to take the historicist turn" (266). Hegel is often taken to be a critic of "dichotomous" forms of thinking, but, in his reply to Boisvert, Rorty justifies his either-orism once again by invoking Hegel:

I think of Hegel as having shown us that promoting such divisions -- insisting on sharp either-ors -- is necessary to keep the conversation going. Without the great nay-sayers, and what Bosvert calls 'dreams of radical fresh starts,' we will not have what Hegel called the 'struggle and labor of the negative' (573).

Dews, in his "'The Infinite is Losing its Charm': Richard Rorty's Philosophy of Religion and the Conflict Between Therapeutic and Pragmatic Critique", places Rorty accurately, I believe, in relation to Hegel by putting him in the company of the nineteenth-century "Left Hegelians", in particular Feuerbach and Stirner:

It is hard to overlook the parallels between Feuerbach's effort to define a radically new mode of philosophizing, and Rorty's advocacy of a post-philosophical thinking, which has abandoned the quest for timeless truths and immutable structures, in favor of cultural-political intervention (640).

But Feuerbach's anthropology was in turn open to Stirner's critique of his appeal to "essences", in this case, anthropological ones. Stirner's construal of "the very notion of objective truth as an outdated trammel, a redundant constraint on the agency of the self" (644) sounds very Rortyan, and if Rorty's appeal to the communal basis of knowledge and morals seems to separate him from Stirner's "rampaging egoism", there are core elements of his thinking that makes it difficult for him to "hold the line against the Stirnerian anarchist" (645).

Dews wonders if it had been this concern that had led Rorty in the last decade of his life to "a conception of human emancipation able to house aspirations formerly nurtured by religion" (646). If Rorty's resistance to religion had come to soften, then one might wonder at the persistence of his antipathy to the Plato-Kant tradition, given his essentially left-Hegelian conception of it as no more than a continuation of religion. Stout, in "Rorty on Religion and Politics", sees only the "smallest possible adjustment in his original secularism" (534) in Rorty's later attitudes to religion, however. Stout questions the compatibility of Rorty's "de-divinizing" form of pragmatism -- which he shares with Dewey, but with neither Peirce nor James -- with other features of his pragmatism. Thus he sees "Rorty's generalized anticlericalism" as "in tension with his antiessentialism" (536) and his exclusion of religiously articulated claims from the public sphere as in tension with his advocacy of democracy.

As with a small number of other essays in the volume, Dews's is not accompanied by Rorty's response because it had been finished too late. With this essay in particular, I had been looking forward to Rorty's reply, wondering if and how he was going to slip through the nets Dews had fashioned for him. Unfortunately, we no longer have the benefit of his table-turning rejoinders. From the evidence provided from this volume, however, this is unlikely to stop the man and his ideas from remaining, for many, foci of admiration and provocation and a continuing source of both inspiration and frustration.