The Texts of Early Greek Philosophy: The Complete Fragments and Selected Testimonies of the Major Presocratics

Aims of the Work

Hermann Diels' seminal Die Fragmente der Vorsokratiker (hereafter, DK) set the highest of standards for sourcebooks of early ancient Greek philosophy, and it has remained the scholar's single most indispensible tool for researching and reconstructing the philosophical thought of the figures of that time. However, nearly six decades have passed since Walther Kranz produced the sixth and latest revised edition of that work.[1] Without periodic polishing over that time, our gold standard has lost some of its luster, for in those three score years, the body of our source material has grown as new texts have been discovered (e.g., the Derveni and Strasbourg papyri) and significant fragments and testimonials have been identified in already extant works. At the same time, scholarly opinions concerning the 'Presocratics' have developed and shifted, sometimes radically. Nonetheless, DK has remained utterly indispensible, as no other comparable work has come forward to either update or replace it.

Daniel Graham makes similar observations in his preface to The Texts of Early Greek Philosophy (hereafter, TEGP), where he discusses how and why this work came about. A newly revised version of DK, and one, furthermore, which would also include English translations of all its fragments and testimonies, would constitute a truly peerless contribution to the study of the history of philosophy and to classical scholarship more broadly. Readers of TEGP who come to it expecting a successor to DK will leave it disappointed, however; it is not sufficiently comprehensive or exhaustive. Nonetheless, it would be a mistake to undervalue Graham's work for that reason, as TEGP is not really designed to replace DK. Rather, it is intended to satisfy a legitimate and pressing need for which there is currently no suitable alternative -- namely, for what Graham describes as "not so much an exhaustive collection" but "a bridge between the introductory textbook and the exhaustive collection, a kind of portable and up-to-date assemblage of the texts everyone should have access to for the figures everyone studies" (p. xiii). TEGP succeeds in this mission, and admirably, though not flawlessly. Whether there are weaknesses in Graham's framing of TEGP's mission is a theme to which I will return later.

Description of TEGP

TEGP is divided into two attractive, paperback volumes, with Vol. I (pp. i-xiv+1-685) being more than twice the length of Vol. II (689-1020). Apart from all the indices, Vol. II contains only the Sophists and an appendix on Pythagoras. This division is less than ideal because it (1) somewhat ghettoizes the Sophists, while (2) making it impossible to use Vol. I entirely on its own. The total work consists of 19 chapters and an appendix; a concordance to DK; an index fontium and, for passages mentioned but not included as texts, a brief index locorum; and, finally, a general index.

Typical chapters begin with a brief introduction to their respective Presocratic philosopher and his thought, then contain texts and fragments followed by brief commentaries on selected texts, and conclude with a bibliography.[2] The fragments that Graham regards as authentic are interspersed among the rest of the texts, with the surrounding texts typically providing useful context for the fragments. Each text is numbered, and fragments are given an additional fragment number in boldface and marked with the letter F. Greek and Latin texts, and an ample critical apparatus, are placed on the left-hand, even-numbered pages, and English translations face them on the right-hand, odd-numbered pages.

The majority of the chapters (1-12, 15-18) each focus on a single figure. The exceptions are chapters 13-14, 19, and the appendix. Chapter 13 consists of texts and fragments for both Leucippus and Democritus (who are not given separate numbering schemes), while chapter 14, which continues the numbering from the previous chapter, consists of the numerous ethical fragments that exist for Democritus. It is unclear why these needed to be separate chapters.[3] Chapter 19 consists of two parts: each is a long, anonymous text of a fifth-century Sophist, the Anonymous Iamblichi (DK89) and the Dissoi Logoi (DK90), respectively. The appendix contains 26 testimonies concerning Pythagoras and early Pythagoreanism, drawn from several different chapters of DK.[4]

Graham's translations are literal and generally quite reliable, while the inclusion of the original texts for testimonies means that readers will be able to check Graham in all cases, and not just with the fragments. Scholars will inevitably find this or that rendering of a difficult passage or obscure technical term to quibble over, but I do not think that they will find outright mistakes to be numerous.[5]

TEGP is extremely well-suited to be a "bridge" work of the kind that Graham describes; it will be best used as a source book for graduate and advanced undergraduate students in upper-level survey courses of Presocratic philosophy. In such courses, it is necessary that students have access to the original Greek and Latin texts, but it is also desirable that they should be aided by reliable English translations. Before TEGP, there was no one book that satisfied these needs. Freeman's Ancilla contained only translations for the "B" texts (fragments) in DK, but none for the numerous "A" texts (testimonia); for their original-language texts, one still needed DK. Additionally, in courses covering the Sophists, Kent-Sprague's The Older Sophists was necessary as a further supplement. The better alternative was to use several bilingual editions of individual Presocratic philosophers, such as those in the Phoenix supplements series or individual works.[6] But this was very expensive for students and quite difficult to manage, as (a) not all of these works have remained in print, (b) not every major Presocratic has his own volume, and (c) many such works provide Greek and Latin texts for fragments but not for testimonies.[7] This situation has been completely transformed (and dramatically improved) by the appearance of a collection that includes side-by-side Greek and Latin texts and English translations for both the fragments and the testimonies of a large number of the most important Presocratic philosophers, in two light and affordable paperback volumes. For this reason especially, Graham's work constitutes an important contribution to the field, and it is bound to become a staple of the ancient philosophy curriculum.

Undertaking the arrangement and translation of nearly 1600 separately numbered texts for 20 different figures was undoubtedly a Herculean labor, and Graham has produced a work that is both valuable and impressive. Some number of infelicities, errors, and omissions is inevitable and easily forgiven in a first edition of a work of this scope. However, the principles of selection for the inclusion or exclusion of both the figures and their respective source texts are properly subject to scrutiny and criticism. It is also fair to criticize general editorial policies that seem inconsistent or unclear. In what follows, I will raise three concerns about the work: 1) The exclusion of certain key figures (and one key text) for want of belonging to the list of the usual Presocratic suspects whom "everyone studies;" 2) editorial inconsistency, specifically: (A) the absence of sufficient cross-referencing between the Presocratic authors and (B) the lack of a clear policy with respect to numbering and identifying short fragments; and 3) the omission of a large number of testimonies in DK and other collections.

Selection of "Presocratic" Philosophical Figures (A Plea for some of the Excluded)

For the most part, Graham's selection of figures represents what I will refer to as the "Presocratic consensus." There is no single, absolute orthodoxy in the scholarship of sixth- and fifth-century Greek philosophy. The "Presocratic Consensus," as I use the term, represents a broad set of commitments widely held throughout Anglophone scholarship on the subject since at least the early 1970s. It can be analyzed into at least 3 significant components.

The first aspect of this consensus is a broad conception of the nature and development of Presocratic philosophy, and a notion of what themes are most central and germane to it. Graham describes this development as having four phases: first, the cosmological phase, represented by the Milesians; second, a metaphysical and anti-cosmological phase, represented by the Eleatics; third, a post-Eleatic attempt to reconcile cosmology with deeper claims about metaphysics; and fourth, a period in which philosophy turns away from cosmological interests and instead focuses on social human concerns -- this being the period of Socrates and the Sophists, who were, as Graham puts it, "the first humanists and social scientists" (p. 5).

Second, the consensus upholds a certain canon, or pantheon, of key philosophers -- those whom, as Graham puts it, "everyone reads." The pantheon generally follows the lines of the developmental picture above: first, there is the Milesian triad of Thales, Anaximander, and Anaximenes; then there are three major interstitial characters who do not quite fit Graham's four-part mold: Pythagoras, Xenophanes, and Heraclitus; third, the Eleatics: Parmenides, Zeno, and Melissus; fourth, the post-Eleatic cosmologists, namely: the "Pluralists" such as Anaxagoras and Empedocles, the Atomists Leucippus and Democritus, and the last hold-out of Milesian material monism, Diogenes of Apollonia; and fifth and finally, the Older Sophists. Their most significant members are taken to be Protagoras and Gorgias, with Antiphon, Prodicus, and Hippias in the second rank, followed lastly by Critias, Thrasymachus, Lycophron, et al.

Finally, the consensus chooses to define early Greek philosophy in terms of a boundary line set by Socrates, so that those figures it considers are to be labeled and understood as "Pre-Socratic." This choice of Socrates as the liminal figure in no small part reflects a persistent myth -- that in Socrates, or in the philosophical thinkers of the latter half of the fifth century BCE in general, there is a famous turn inward, away from the natural operations of the cosmos and its ontology, to the human level and its concerns.

Graham does not slavishly follow this tradition; his selection of major figures contains two important deviations from the standard roll. First, he chooses to include Philolaus, a fifth-century Greek Pythagorean, and this is a much-welcome addition to the stock set of characters from whose list Philolaus is typically and regrettably missing. Second, he chooses to demote the role of Pythagoras in light of the lack of reliable evidence as to the nature of his views and to treat Pythagorean material only in an Appendix. This may go some ways toward finally dispelling old and persistent myths that ascribe to Pythagoras sophisticated mathematical thought which was in fact developed by figures such as Philolaus and Archytas and members of Plato's Academy. In all other respects, however, TEGP is a relatively orthodox collection, with all the advantages and disadvantages that this implies. The collection is conservative, as are the assumptions that seem to underlie it concerning who or what is "philosophical" and in what way. This leads to several costly omissions.

Archytas (or: Why Stop at Socrates?)

On the consensus approach, the life of Socrates chronologically marks a turning point in Greek philosophy, and Socrates' thought constitutes a watershed in the intellectual development of Greek philosophy, by way of its increased attention to social-political-ethical matters. With respect to both points, the "orthodoxy" is mistaken, and, consequently, inconsistent.

Neither Socrates' birth, acme, or death chronologically defines the end of "Presocratic" philosophy. Three very important figures in TEGP -- Gorgias, Prodicus, and Democritus -- all died sometime after Socrates, and the two latter men were born contemporary to or as much as a decade later than Plato's famous teacher. There is no meaningful chronological sense in which Prodicus or Democritus are pre-Socrates, but to omit them from a collection of Presocratic philosophers would be a bizarre, even stunning heterodoxy. This illustrates that the pantheon of the so-called "Presocratic" philosophers is by no means fixed by the firm dates of Socrates' birth and death.[8] Consequently, there is no mandate according to which one must exclude figures such as Archytas on the grounds that they chronologically succeeded Socrates. While the latter was a relatively late figure (roughly contemporary with Plato), he represents the final stage in the autonomous, pre-Platonic development of Pythagoreanism, one of the central strains of "Presocratic" philosophical thought.[9] Thus, I find Graham's justification of his exclusion (and Nausiphanes') rather weak (p. 13).

Solon (or: Greek Moral and Political Philosophy does not begin with the Sophists)

Nor is it the case that Greek philosophy was irrevocably transformed into a different enterprise through Socrates, as many have claimed.[10] In Graham's narrative, Greek philosophy was primarily constituted by cosmology and metaphysics prior to the latter half of the fifth century BCE, at which point a dramatic shift occurred away from "natural philosophy" toward the moral or "human" philosophy of Socrates and the Sophists. "Only in the early fourth century, with the rise of the Socratic schools and their personal approach to moral self-knowledge -- and their contempt for abstract speculation -- did the early style of philosophy fade out" (p. 3). This aspect of the consensus picture is also untenable, for the interests of most Presocratic philosophers are not nearly as dichotomous as it implies. While primarily seeing him as a metaphysician and anti-cosmologist, Graham himself notes that Parmenides was seen by his immediate contemporaries as "a revisionary cosmologist rather than as an anti-cosmologist" (p. 5). Similarly, despite viewing the activity of the Sophists primarily in the social-scientific terms already mentioned, Graham grants that "Many of them also pursued cosmological interests, dealt with Eleatic arguments, and also extended inquiry into new areas of social studies and linguistics" (p. 5).

The story of a dramatic shift from natural, extrospective thinking (cosmology and metaphysics) to humanistic, introspective thinking (ethics, sociopolitical philosophy) is more misleading than it is edifying. As one can see from TEGP, which divides Democritus into two full chapters, the latter devoted exclusively to the very large number of his ethical fragments, there was no such dichotomy of interests for him. However, the artificial chapter division between his (and Leucippus') "metaphysical/scientific" material in Ch. 13 and his "human" thought in Ch. 14 sustains and propagates this misrepresentation. There is likewise a profound concern with social/ethical questions among thinkers who are better known for their metaphysical, theological, and epistemological contributions, e.g., Xenophanes and Heraclitus. Spiritual purification is a key theme for Empedocles, and even in the case of Anaxagoras, we might take his disinterest in his own wealth and political fortunes as, at least implicitly, a stance with regard to what is a value for a person. Unfortunately, when this picture is taken more or less for granted, it leads to the omission of important earlier philosophical thinkers whose work does not fit the pre-established historical mold of development and who are not otherwise sufficiently well-entrenched in the pantheon.

A key figure left off the list of ordained Presocratic philosophers on this account is Solon. Before there were "lovers of wisdom", the Greeks had "wise-men" or sages. Of the Seven Sages, only Thales receives consistent philosophical attention, even though Solon's thought is comparatively much better preserved. It is typical to find Solon in collections of Early Greek political thought, but highly atypical to find him in a handbook to Presocratic philosophy.[11] This could and should be rectified.

Pherecydes, Orphism, and the Derveni Papyrus

Even the division between "philosophy" (whether it be natural or social) and less veridical modes of thought is far harder to cleanly draw in Ancient Greece than Graham's prefatory comments might suggest. Although it is relatively clear to us in our own time, the line between rational argument and science, on the one hand, and religious mysticism and mythical poetry, on the other hand, becomes profoundly blurred when we look to figures such as Heraclitus, Empedocles, Philolaus, and Alcmaeon.[12] Admitting this does not concede equal epistemic standing to the irrational or the primitive, nor does it erase the importance of the intellectual achievements of the Presocratic philosophers. It does, however, lead to a more accurate view of the intellectual milieu of sixth and fifth century Greece.

Once this is granted, many highly influential strains of semi-philosophical thought such as Orphism, which would otherwise be excluded for being too heavily steeped in myth, are restored to the realm of consideration. A second appendix, focusing on Pherecydes and Orphic cosmogony and eschatology, would naturally complement the appendix on Pythagoras/Pythagoreanism. Even if that is too much to hope for, it is imperative that a collection like TEGP contain the Derveni Papyrus. Even guides to Presocratic philosophy that are pitched at a much more introductory level have wisely begun to include it.[13]

Alcmaeon

Finally, even were one to accept the temporal, textual, and philosophical constraints that Graham sets down as standards of selection, Alcmaeon of Croton easily earns the right to inclusion. Alcmaeon's argument for the immortality of the soul (by the comparison of its motion to the constant motion of the gods in the heavens) was adapted by Plato in the Phaedrus (245c-246a), and that argument in turn was transformed into the first known cosmological argument, which we find in book X of the Laws. Of no less importance were Alcmaeon's use of the contraries in cosmology, or his early scientific explorations in anatomy. The only apparent reason for leaving him out is that he is not already a canonical member of the established pantheon of Presocratic luminaries. However, a sourcebook of this kind should not only cater to its readers' preexisting notions of which figures to regard as important; it should also help to shape and expand their views of who merits serious consideration. The inclusion of Alcmaeon in subsequent editions would have the same kind of positive influence on the field that the chapter on Philolaus will have.

Editorial Concerns

Cross-Referencing

On two points of general editing, TEGP is somewhat wanting. The first is with regard to cross-referencing. Frequently a testimony will make reference to a number of different Presocratics, but will only be cited in one of the figures' portions. This is not always the case; there are fragments that Graham cross-references in the text and more frequently, though less perspicuously, in the commentaries. However, the total number of cross-references that would have been desirable and that are absent is quite large. For reference, consult Table 2 below.

Fragment Specification

The second point regards the specification of certain words or parts of testimonies as authentic fragments or not. There are a number of fragments collected in DK that are not given fragment status by Graham, and often reasonably so. However, in not all cases is an explanation given in either the footnotes or commentary. More troubling, perhaps, is the inconsistent policy of bold-facing words that, presumably, Graham takes to be authentic. The sole explanation is in his "note on text references", where he states: "I put fragments in bold-face for emphasis" (p. xi). However, in not all cases are bold-faced words identified with fragment numbers, e.g., in Ths35, the famous phrase "all things are full of gods" is in bold, but it is not labeled as a fragment. At other times, especially in the case of the Sophists, fragment numbers are given to a text when no words are bolded. Even Latin texts are at times given fragment numbers. Does this mean that Graham regards them as especially reliable testimonies or paraphrases? It is unclear.

Even more troublesome is the frequency with which terms that are very likely to be genuinely authentic are not put in bold-face. Two examples come to mind readily in the case of Empedocles; first, there is a term to describe what is "ice-like" (κρυσταλλοειδῆ). The multiple occurrences of the term, which in all its forms scans in Empedocles' meter, provide reasonably good evidence for the authenticity of at least one.[14] Second, the famous "effluvia" (ἀπόρροια), an acknowledged technical term of Empedocles', is not bold-faced (pp. 117, 168, 172) except once, when it occurs in a fully preserved line of verse (153[F107]). Similarly, the "ducts/pores" (πόρος) into which they flow are unmarked (pp. 117, 155, 168, 169).[15]

Exclusion of Numerous Testimonia

Numerous testimonies that are in DK are omitted from TEGP, likely for reasons of space. That the number of such testimonies is large -- too large -- will be clear if one consults Table 1, where I have listed all the testimonies that can be found in DK but not TEGP. In addition to these, there are many absent testimonies that can be readily found in other collections besides DK. Notably, several for Democritus are to be found in Luria [1970] and Taylor [1999], while only about half of the testimonies that exist for Prodicus are present.[16]

What is most regrettable about these omissions is that they significantly diminish the value of TEGP as a scholarly reference work. TEGP will be an incomplete guide for any expert, and he or she will have to keep DK and/or individual studies of particular figures on hand. If TEGP had included all the testimonies for the philosophers it contained, it could have been more readily used as a resource for serious research.

Conclusion

Graham no doubt faced difficult decisions about what to include and what to omit, given the constraints of space -- whereas there are no limits to what his readers might have wished to see included. In recognition of this moral hazard, it is better to conclude by praising what we have in TEGP: the first bilingual edition of the works of (many of) the Presocratic philosophers for English speakers, and thus an important and impressive achievement which lays a firm foundation for further expansion and progress.