Amy Olberding notes that this book is a response to increased polarization and conflict in civil life in the United States (ix). Besides political discourse, the problem of incivility or rudeness is found also in everyday social life -- such as what to do when "Uncle Frank" makes offensive remarks about race, sexuality and immigration at the family Thanksgiving dinner (144). Olberding's response is to turn to the Confucian tradition. The early Confucians' commitment to civility can help us to re-think social relations, and arrive at an outlook that recognizes the difficulty of bridging gaps between us but also sustains a sense of solidarity.
Olberding starts from a disconcerting premise, the sheer pleasure of being rude: "I am often rude. I often want to be rude. I often enjoy being rude" (1, italics in original). The pleasure of casting off burdensome self-regulation and letting fly, perhaps at Uncle Frank, contrasts with the labor of polite conduct. Why, then, be polite? So begins a multi-part answer that finds renewed importance in manners, etiquette and civility.
Olberding's book is aimed at a wide audience, and its style is folksy and personal rather than analytic or data-driven. Popular movies and her students' anecdotes provide illustrative examples, and the citations are a few brief endnotes. The attempt to explain Confucian ideas by relating them to the existential concerns of the general reader has solid pedigree. The book might be placed alongside Michael Puett's The Path: What Chinese Philosophers Can Teach Us about the Good Life or Sam Crane's Life Liberty and the Pursuit of Dao. The guiding aim is not so much well-defended scholarly interpretations of texts or analysis of arguments, but to show the value of ancient texts and ideas for the modern reader. Perhaps more importantly, the book is enjoyable to read and insightful.
Regarding the book's structure and arguments, the first chapter lays out the appeal of rudeness and claims that, despite the apparent personal costs, politeness is still worth the effort. Notably, there is a conscious decision to treat civility and good manners as closely linked concepts. This is one of the lessons drawn from Confucian social ethics (4), which is grounded in li (禮, often translated as "ritual"). Civility typically refers to values or virtues often associated with public life and discourse, while good manners apply to everyday social interactions. Their separation in European thought was the product of a particular social and economic history, in which manners and etiquette came to function as markers of social mobility and class rather than having moral significance. For Olberding, however, both are indicators of important pro-social values -- "respect, consideration and toleration" (9) -- that benefit public life and reflect the social nature of people. On this view, for example, etiquette is the form (social codes, gestures and habits) through which such values are recognizably expressed.
One doubt about the book's starting concern bears mention: whether rudeness and incivility are, in fact, enjoyable and politeness a burden. That premise isn't obviously true. People are often nervous at the thought of abrasion and conflict, and even when resorting to incivility -- the dismissive response, the rude gesture, etc. -- it's questionable whether they long for or enjoy it. This might sound like a minor worry, but it is relevant to what follows -- to what extent arguments are needed to dissuade people from rudeness, or whether the arguments presented function more as warnings about the unappreciated dangers of incivility, independently of any psychological or cultural assumptions. In Olberding's defense, the arguments are avowedly confessional -- having a "self-therapeutic quality" (3). Furthermore, the arguments against rudeness will resonate with those contemplating public incivility or bursts of righteous anger for the sake of some supposedly greater good.
Chapters two and three explore reasons for doubting civility and manners, and the attractions of incivility and bad manners. Civility involves upholding norms, such as tolerance and respect, which facilitate open and fair exchange in the public realm (16-18), and incivility involves breaking those social norms, with violations arousing moralized feelings of indignation. "Righteous incivility" arises when incivility is preferred on moral grounds over civility. Acts of righteous incivility might seek to defend shared values (as when anti-fascists violently confront Neo-Nazi marches) or aim to subvert the popular consensus and established norms (the suffragettes' radical campaign for the vote). Incivility can thus be a means to a moral outcome, not least because it attracts attention that can cause people to reflect and so hasten social change.
Righteous incivility is not, however, as attractive as it might appear. In brief, Olberding's concern is that such incivility relies upon a simplified psychology, one motivated by generalizations and a self-righteous sense of integrity. This mindset obscures a host of relevant cognitive reactions and prevents sensitivity to the many perspectives typically involved in social disagreement.
Bad manners operate in a different realm of human conduct, and are faux pas in "low-level, low-stakes, commonplace interactions of daily life" (30). An example Olberding gives is failing to hold open a door for someone. Here, the wrongdoing is a thoughtlessness or impatience, rather than offenses driven by conviction about underlying values. Politeness can also seem to be more trouble than it is worth. It exhausts our conscious attention, is cultivated only with effort and can feel trivial. Furthermore, Olberding insightfully details how allowing manners too much scope in determining conduct can stymie the development of personal character or individuality (35), as well as more meaningful or expressive areas of life. Virtue signaling can become more important than genuine concern or worthwhile projects. Good manners can thus seem to be a trivial or joyless concern.
After exploring reasons to be skeptical of the value of incivility and rudeness, the middle chapters (4-6) explore the case for civility, manners and etiquette. It is here that Olberding draws on classical Confucian thought for inspiration: "there are none who compare to the Confucians for a passionate commitment to manners and civility" (49).
The Confucians offer a different understanding of the purpose and meaning of civility, manners and etiquette in human social life. Olberding agrees with the characterization of civility in terms of toleration and respect; however, she disagrees with the liberal account that such virtues serve the end of allowing others equal opportunity to construct their own version of the good life. On that view, difference and disagreement should be tolerated, within reason, even though this feels at times like an imposition, with the right placed above the good. To use Olberding's analogy, it can feel like paying taxes -- people recognize and endorse overarching aims and values although sustaining them is psychologically uncomfortable.
The Confucians, however, understood civility, etiquette and manners as serving a different purpose. The respect and tolerance they convey are integral to our well-being as social beings: we both need and want social interaction and human relationships, which bring both material and psychological benefit. The goods in life that we prize are often social, "friendship, love, companionship" (56), but the full enjoyment of these requires the cultivation of appropriate skills and sensibilities. Civility and manners provide these. Thus, on this account, everyday social life and its myriad interactions are both the location for and the primary vehicle of human flourishing.
Civility and manners are not only important in local personal relationships, however; they can also regulate dealings with strangers, or those for whom no affection exists. They keep interactions civil even when the desire for connection is absent, and our love-hate relationships with fellow humans mean that this is often the case. They do this by acting on our habits and psychology, to bring them into line with the basic fact of mutual interdependence.
Dependency not only refers to nurturing or meeting needs, but to more subtle connections, including the myriad achievements of others that make our own projects viable (those who "maintain the electric grid . . . designed my laptop technology . . . created written language" etc., 53). We cannot always be in friendly relations with others, but out sociality still draws us together in many ways. Recognition of this means, following the Confucian Xunzi, that we have to be trained or educated accordingly: even when our moods or feelings are not prosocial or friendly, our stance towards others is consistent with this oft-unacknowledged reality. The practical significance of this sociality and dependency, involving both the living and dead, is not well captured by ideals central to modern liberal society, such as the primacy of conscious volition and choice. In this, the messy Confucian picture of human psychology and habit formation offers a realism that lofty abstractions in contemporary social and political thought -- such as Rawls' original position -- fail to capture.
The importance of "sociality," and its role in human flourishing, to Olberding's argument for manners and politeness raises a question for her about what sociality is and its relation to civility. Sociality is variously glossed as dependency, the desirability of cooperation, something worked at or learnt (56), a cultivated personal sensitivity or psychological responsiveness to others, important for psychological well-being (57), yet something we are not always conscious of (58). It is even implicated in an account of the good life for people: "maintaining our social bonds with others is what renders us fully, magnificently human" (55, italics in original). Olberding discusses sociality in some detail (53-58), but so much is packed in here that it invites a longer and fuller discussion. Do manners and civility primarily convey attitudes such as toleration and respect? Or are they the grounds of a sense of connection with others that brings the most profound form of well-being? One wonders whether the defender of the liberal view of civility and manners, noted above, can agree on the need for civil cooperation, expressions of respect, and a cultivated sensitivity in social interactions but disagree that social bonds are the highest end, what is distinctively human. The painter Paul Gauguin might have suffered from stunted sociality and yet arguably produced a life (and art) of great value that was possible only because his sociality was marginalized. Some forms of difficult-to-attain human excellence seem to eschew at least some aspects of sociality.
This is not a criticism so much as a longing to hear more, since greater detail about sociality can further strengthen the case for seeing manners and civility in the Confucian way. Does sociality entail a metaphysical claim about the self, as being relational in nature, as some have read the Confucian texts? Or an empirical claim that, correctly understood, the most complete well-being is realized specifically through social interaction and personal bonds? But if so, and if we can satisfy our need for sociality by interacting only with "my kind of people" (67), however bad this is for public discourse, then how strongly can the desire for sociality motivate wider public engagement? Still, the points made are well-taken and, as a book aimed at a wide audience, it achieves a good balance between analysis and appeals to ordinary experience.
The final two chapters finish with a response to the lingering suspicion that righteous incivility is sometimes preferable to remaining within the bounds of civility. Recent events in North American society and politics, such as concern about climate change or the normalization of lying in public office, might appear to justify a hardening of stances and more direct acts of resistance. Yet the Confucian tradition bestows upon everyday civility -- as customs, manners and etiquette -- an authority that approaches moral demands. So, what are the limits of good form, politeness, and decorum? Perhaps the Confucian stance is anachronistic, naïve or even reactionary -- not least because remaining bound to civility as public life deteriorates makes one vulnerable to being taken advantage of. Such concerns threaten Olberding's premise: that we moderns can learn from the Confucian tradition.
In response, Olberding articulates alternatives to "heroic incivility", by first distinguishing between dissent and incivility. Acts of dissent can be effective yet civil, as seen in the non-violent mass demonstrations of the American civil rights movement. Remaining civil in the face of incivility might also inspire others to do likewise. Olberding, however, is skeptical that civil dissent has such effects. Instead, she defends civility by highlighting "an alternative psychology of disagreement" (145) -- and here lies a possible answer to the question of how sociality in the local and personal sense can have an effect in the broader public realm.
Incivility involves various cognitive and attitudinal failings. These include a misplaced sense of moral superiority, hasty evaluation of others, an implicit claim to decide who deserves censure and, most relevant to the Confucians, the "tribalizing effects" of abandoning a commitment to sociality -- i.e., a reductive view of the world as divided into us and "those people" hostile to our values. The Confucian lesson here is to recognize and normalize this inner ambivalence, and offer mechanisms through which commitment to social connections is sustained in spite of negative attitudes to others. We can confront our disagreements, struggling with them without resorting to the incivility that would sever social ties. The struggle enables access to valuable interpersonal attitudes -- such as generosity, epistemic humility, and the feelings of being torn or inner conflict typically experienced in disagreements with friends and family. Being able to dwell in this messy grey area, aware of if not always directly motivated by our sociality, is the true engine of civility. Strangers and distant acquaintances clearly lack such intimacy, but access to the kind of cautious and complex cognitive life generated in personal attachments can also ward off the "dark assumptions about another's character" (149) that promote incivility in the public realm. Readers familiar with the Confucian thinker Mencius might here detect traces of his idea of psychologically extending concern for family to distant others.
Olberding finishes with one final question: why bother being polite when it involves personal cost, vulnerability, and seems to make such little difference to the world? She rejects two obvious justifications: that being polite inspires others to be polite, and that virtue (good manners) brings its own reward. Instead, the consolation of politeness centers on hope (164). If well-mannered interaction leads, in some small measure, to a better life for others (perhaps future generations) then the effort was worthwhile.
Perhaps Olberding is too modest in her hopes for motivating politeness. Confidence in manners also seems to come from appreciation of how they function within broader social systems. We queue for the bus not because of some future hope but because it enhances the goods integral to a well-functioning mass-transit system. It works better when everyone holds to customary norms of interaction and of use. In this context, we also have recourse to devices that encourage compliance -- shame, blame and civil indignation. Further, we can make arguments to the rude -- that good manners will benefit them -- in the form of a smoothly running system, less conflict with other passengers, etc. If that fails, more punitive options are available. Hence, the situation might not be so bleak if we consider politeness both within this richer psychological picture (some of which Olberding outlines) and within the larger social structures in which social interaction with strangers unfolds.
Regardless of these minor reservations, this is clearly a book for the times. It challenges the reader to reflect more carefully on the costs of tribalism and incivility, at a time when reasonable people are increasingly tempted by them. This richly imaginative exercise in renewing civic life deserves the widest possible audience.