In this short and engaging volume, Peter Adamson explores a range of medieval answers to questions of epistemic authority. The first five chapters address (primarily) Islamic answers to the question of how one should balance epistemic deference to authority against the importance of being responsible for one’s beliefs, while the final two chapters focus on how those issues play out, respectively, in the case of women authors and debates about the value of reason itself. Written in an easy, conversational tone that renders the subject matter accessible to non-experts as well as to scholars of medieval thought, Don’t Think for Yourself takes an admirably inclusive approach to its subject matter. We expect that it will be a boon especially to those looking for historical precedents to contemporary debates and those who teach medieval philosophy at both the undergraduate and graduate levels. (The whole volume could serve as the hub of a unit on medieval epistemology, for instance, while Chapters 1–3 would be an excellent supplement to discussions of Al-Ghazali’s Deliverance from Error, whether in conversation with Descartes’s First and Second Meditations or on its own.)
The basic set of issues discussed in the volume are both familiar and pressing: We all trust the word of others at least on some occasions—so how are we to determine when it is appropriate to defer to authority from when it is appropriate (or even obligatory) to think for oneself? Among those working on medieval philosophy, this topic has often been addressed by scholars looking at the scholastic tradition for antecedents of the Reformation and its emphasis on the freedom to judge for oneself. (Indeed, potted histories of the Renaissance and Reformation often erroneously define these movements partly in terms of ‘breaking free’ from the stifling epistemic authority of the Catholic Church and ushering in the age of free thinking that made the Scientific Revolution possible.) Refreshingly, Adamson frames his discussion instead in terms of two Islamic legal notions important in the 9th–12th centuries: taqlid (deference to an authority) and ijtihad (a judgement arrived at independently). In so doing, Adamson both demonstrates the ubiquity of this topic and allows the reader to draw their own parallels to the later debates in Western Scholasticism, the Reformation, and Counter-Reformation thought.
Chapter One first introduces the notions of taqlid and ijtihad in an accessible, informative manner and then teases out some of the history and nuance of these two terms and the apparent poles they represent. What emerges is that no major Muslim jurist or theologian maintains an all-or-nothing position when it comes to taqlid. Precedents are important, but they can be overturned if new evidence or new reasons come to light. Likewise, ijtihad is to be constrained on both practical and principled grounds. (When going it alone, for instance, even an expert can make mistakes; at the same time, it is also highly unlikely that a majority of learned individuals would be wrong in a way that could be corrected easily by one individual’s effort.) Indeed, a wholesale rejection of taqlid can lead to a wholesale skepticism of expertise—a pernicious form of which can be seen in our own times in social-media-fueled skepticism about vaccines and climate change.
In Chapter 2, Adamson follows this line of thinking to show how the Aristotelian falasifa of the 9th–12th centuries encounter their own special form of skepticism. Particular passages in Aristotle’s Posterior Analytics, for instance, seem to imply that true knowledge can only be had via an individual’s achieving cognition of universal, necessary, and eternal truths via certain demonstrative syllogisms. Since human beings inhabit a world full of corruptible, contingent, sensible particulars, one wonders whether human beings are capable of such knowledge at all. Adamson introduces us to several figures in the medieval Islamic intellectual milieu (including Jewish thinkers living in Islamic lands and writing in Arabic such as Saadia Gaon) who respond by conceding the difficulty but insisting that the senses can provide us with a kind of “knowledge”—one inferior to the proper sort, but still worthy of being given the name. The chapter then turns to a skeptical argument most famously launched by Abu Hamid Muhammad al-Ghazali that challenges the notion that proper knowledge is self-validating. If this were true, then even allegedly self-evident axioms, such as “the whole is greater than the part” or the law of non-contradiction, could be false. Although there are responses that could be made to Ghazali’s challenge, and Adamson lucidly leads the reader through some of them, many dyed-in-the-wool Aristotelians ultimately concede that they had set the epistemic bar too high. Particularly if we allow that God has the power to make things contrary to nature (which many did), then if one must be able to validate for herself each step in an argument and/or each thing that grounds the alleged truth in order to know anything with certainty, it seems that few—if any!—human beings would ever find themselves in such a position.
More practically, virtually everyone acknowledges that the range of potentially knowable truths is so vast that no mortal being could be an expert about everything, and thus that we all need to let specialized experts do the thinking for us in at least some domains. This, in turn, raises the question of how one identifies those experts to whom we should defer, and in which contexts. Chapter 3 thus examines how medieval thinkers went about determining who is authoritative and who is not—a question that often arises in discussions of how to determine which faith is the true faith. By examining some of the positions staked out by Ghazali, as well as by “uncompromising rationalists” such as Ibn Rushd, Peter Abelard, and Ramon Llull, Adamson begins to articulate more fully the notion of a “justified taqlid”, which works by directing our epistemic aim away from unattainable Aristotelian knowledge-strictly-speaking and towards justified belief.
In Chapters 4 and 5, Adamson explores how Muslim and Christian philosophers employed the pagan authority of Plato and Aristotle in arguing over which religious beliefs are properly justified. By way of illustration, in Chapter 4, Adamson looks at how several Muslim and Christian thinkers utilized Aristotelian logic—characterized as “common intellectual property” —in their disputes over the intelligibility of the doctrine of the Trinity. Chapter 5 covers in considerable length medieval debates on the issue of whether the opinions of Plato and Aristotle are “in harmony”, or whether Platonism was superior to Aristotelianism, or vice versa. In tracing some of the ways in which medieval thinkers defended the harmony thesis or picked a favorite, Adamson shows (among other things) how the Italian humanists of the 15–16th centuries separated themselves from medieval Aristotelianism not so much by attempting to demonstrate the overall superiority of Plato’s philosophy to that of Aristotle’s, but rather by critiquing individual theses put forth by the Peripatetics. At the end of Chapter 5, for instance, Adamson turns his attention to Lucrezia Marinella’s argument in The Nobility and the Excellence of Women and the Defects and Shortcomings of Men (1599) that Platonism is the preferable philosophy because Aristotle was a misogynist whereas Plato was not.
Throughout these first five chapters, Adamson convincingly demonstrates that most medieval thinkers’ response to the question of whether and when to think for oneself was to settle upon some version of the middle view—namely, that while utterly free and open inquiry leads to error, authorities must also be treated critically. Disagreements about epistemic authority centered primarily around the conditions under which it is appropriate to be skeptical of authoritative texts and traditions, and/or how to delimit the horizons of free rational inquiry. The notable exceptions to this broad consensus are the Muslim falasifa, “elitist”, “avant-garde” Aristotelians like Al-Farabi, Ibn Sina (Avicenna), and Ibn Rushd (Averroes), who maintain a much more favorable assessment of the powers of human reason and their right to go wherever the best arguments take them. But even they, Adamson argues, are best understood when placed within the wider debate among Muslim intellectuals over the proper place of taqlid and ijtihad.
While Adamson’s framing in these chapters is Islamic and its major protagonists are by and large Muslims, readers are introduced to viewpoints from the Jewish and Christian traditions as well, including a host of lesser-known figures such as the Ethiopian Christian polemicist Enbaqom and the previously mentioned Lucrezia Marinella. Marinella’s treatise also serves as the bridge between the theoretical discussion of the first five chapters and the more practical issues addressed in the final two. Chapter 6 focuses specifically on strategies medieval women authors in the Rome-based Christian tradition used to persuade their audience to treat them as authorities. These women, Adamson notes, were well aware of what Miranda Fricker has dubbed ‘epistemic injustice’ and engaged in a kind of “tactical retreat” where they generally conceded “normal” authority to men and claimed that they ought to be heeded not because they possessed special claims to knowledge but because they spoke truths that were available to even the humblest, and/or because they served as “passive conduits”, allowing God to speak through them without their interference.
In the seventh and final chapter, Adamson returns to the elitist rationalism of the Islamic Aristotelians and asks why reason and knowledge are so valuable to them in the first place. The answer in large part stems from the Aristotelian notion that rationality is what marks human beings off from other animals: exercising reason to its fullest extent is necessary for us to realize fully our human nature and achieve happiness. Since human flourishing requires that we actualize our cognitive powers in this way, one must reject taqlid in favor of ijtihad and become an Aristotelian philosopher. But, as Adamson shows, a hard line between humans and non-human animals is difficult for medieval thinkers to maintain. For one thing, such thinkers were aware of a plenitude of empirical evidence suggesting that animals do not entirely lack reason. There is also the unsettling implication that if one special sort of thinking—say, deductive reasoning—is the mark of humanity, then many individuals belonging to the species homo sapiens are not fully human and thus may be subjugated and exploited. While Adamson concedes that “the medievals typically took for granted that the elite had a monopoly on both the tools of violence and the means of knowledge”, he does point to several outliers, including several of the “women humanists” covered in chapter 6 and “moral crusaders” such as Bartolomé de las Casas.
Medieval philosophy is too vast a subfield for any scholar to be expert in all of it: the span of time involved is too long, the traditions too diverse, the languages needed to master the texts too many. Anyone writing on a broad topic in the field must thus always make a number of choices about how best to balance taqlid and ijtihad in their own work. Adamson himself is most at home in the Arabic literature, and here his facility with primary texts and secondary scholarship makes his presentation of the material shine. At the same time, the volume also highlights the extensive spadework—often admirably collaborative—that Adamson has engaged in over the past fifteen years to cover the history of philosophy “without any gaps” (https://historyofphilosophy.net).
Our only quibble with Don’t Think for Yourself is a minor one that involves the ‘tactical retreat’ attributed to medieval women authors in Chapter 6, worth mentioning primarily because of how it demonstrates the need for continued work in these areas. Adamson, like most scholars who don’t specialize in the contemplative tradition in which most of those women are writing, takes their claims to be “worms”, “unworthy servants”, and “useless handmaids” as distinctive of their sex and contrastive with the greater authority of their male counterparts. The true function of such rhetoric, however, is a bit more complicated (see, e.g., Van Dyke 2022). First, male authors in the same tradition also routinely use such phrases; pride was understood to be the worst of the sins, and humility a virtue of central importance for contemplatives. Second, the fact that women portrayed themselves as vessels or conduits for God to speak through is grounded in the mainstream Augustinian belief that God is the only true teacher; any number of male contemplatives make the same move. These Christian contemplatives are thus on the same wavelength as Ghazali: it is the scholastics and falasifa who need to explain themselves, when they speak as if their own powers of reason suffice to know what is true.
We do not mean to suggest that medieval women didn’t face special hurdles when attempting to be heard, but it’s also true that their intellectual accomplishments have been subject to the phenomenon Eileen O’Neill (1997) called “disappearing ink”, with their contributions written out of history so thoroughly in the past centuries that we today have lost sight of it. New research continues to show, however, that medieval women were far better versed in, and influential on, the major theological debates taking place in the universities and mendicant study houses of the 13th–15th centuries. As Don’t Think for Yourself itself richly demonstrates, medieval attitudes towards questions of epistemic authority are much more complex and interesting than we might have initially supposed.
REFERENCES
Christina Van Dyke (2002). “Lewd, Feeble, and Frail: Humility Formulae, Medieval Women, and Authority,” in Oxford Studies in Medieval Philosophy 10, pp. 1–23.
Eileen O’Neill (1997). “Disappearing Ink: Early Modern Women Philosophers and Their Fate in History,” in J. A. Kournay (ed), Philosophy in a Feminist Voice: Critiques and Reconstructions. Princeton University Press, pp. 17–62.