1. Introduction
Jacob McNulty’s Hegel’s Logic and Metaphysics is a great contribution to the lively and ongoing debates about how best to interpret Hegel’s conception of logic, in light of the place that Hegel assigns to logic in his own philosophical system, as well as in light of his relation to earlier traditions in the philosophy of logic. McNulty’s book is fluidly written, well-organized, and admirably readable (despite containing a considerable number of typographical errors), and is broadly successful in putting forward a new, genuinely distinctive, decidedly ‘metaphysical’ approach to Hegel’s main writings on logic.
Throughout his book, McNulty engages with many leading figures in the interpretive debates surrounding Hegel’s logic, including Karin de Boer, Brady Bowman, Klaus Düsing, Stephen Houlgate, Franz Knappik, Anton Koch, James Kreines, Béatrice Longuenesse, Angelica Nuzzo, Terry Pinkard, Robert Pippin, Paul Redding, Robert Stern, and Michael Wolff. McNulty usefully positions his own take on Hegel’s conception of logic against the views of Hegel’s predecessors on the relation between logic and metaphysics, including Aristotle and especially Kant, also making effective use of comparisons and contrasts with pre-Kantian rationalists (and how they were creatively reinterpreted by post-Kantians): Descartes (in light of Fichte), the Leibniz-Wolffians, Spinoza (in light of Jacobi). Finally, McNulty also helpfully illuminates the position he ascribes to Hegel through comparison with views of successors also deeply influenced by German Idealism, including the neo-Kantians and the early Heidegger. McNulty’s book should thus be of interest to anyone working on Hegel, the inheritance of Kantianism and pre-Kantian rationalists by way of German Idealism, and those working on the history of metaphysics and philosophy of logic in the (early and late) modern period more broadly.
To give a better sense of the significance of some of McNulty’s central interpretive contentions, as well as to convey some of what makes McNulty’s book a compelling one to engage with, let me first give a brief introduction to Hegel’s writings on logic and sketch some prominent interpretive puzzles. I’ll then bring into focus several distinctive themes in McNulty’s interpretive approach. I will conclude by raising concerns about the viability of McNulty’s approach, both to invite further discussion from McNulty, but also to flag obstacles facing the broader family of ‘metaphysical’ readings of Hegel’s Logic.
2. Three questions about Hegel’s Logic and McNulty’s answers
Hegel published two books with ‘logic’ in the title, both after his 1807Phenomenology of Spirit: first, a larger Science of Logic (1st edition: 1812–16), then a shorter Science of Logic, included as the first of three ‘sciences’ presented in Hegel’s Encyclopedia of the Philosophical Sciences (1st edition, 1817). (I will refer to the common project of these books as Hegel’s ‘Logic’.) Readers have faced three main interpretive challenges: one concerning what Hegel means by ‘logic’, given certain peculiarities of the contents of these works; another concerning the significance of Hegel’s placing his Logic at the outset of his ‘Encyclopedic’ system of philosophy; and a third concerning the status of Hegel’s Logic in relation to the earlier Phenomenology.
The first challenge arises with even a cursory glance at the titles of the first two (and largest) of the three Parts of each Logic, which would seem to indicate instead metaphysical or ontological topics—namely, a ‘Doctrine of Being’ and a ‘Doctrine of Essence’. The second arises once the Logic is recognized as the first ‘Part’ of a still larger ‘system’ which moves on to include the ‘Philosophy of Nature’ and the ‘Philosophy of Spirit’ (often referred to as Hegel’s Realphilosophie). The third follows on the heels of the second, since the earlier Phenomenology was already billed as the ‘first part’ of the ‘system of science’ on its original title page, with the Logic and the ‘Sciences of Nature and of Spirit’ being announced, in Hegel’s own self-advertisement of the Phenomenology, as forthcoming in a second companion volume.
At one level, McNulty’s book appears to be arguing for relatively straightforward responses to these three challenges. Highlighting Hegel’s own affirmation of a ‘coincidence’ of his Logic with what had previously been treated under the heading of ‘metaphysics’ (Enz §24), McNulty argues that the first Parts of the Logic should be read as just that—as an ‘ontology’ (24). These sections still merit the title ‘Logic’, however, on McNulty’s reading, since they provide the ‘foundation’ for the explanation (deduction, derivation; cf. 27) of the topics usually taken (in the early modern period) to be logic’s subject-matter (viz. concepts, judgments, inferences), topics which McNulty sees Hegel as deriving in the Logic’s third main Part, entitled ‘the Doctrine of the Concept’. In explanatorily grounding the principles of traditional logic, McNulty sees Hegel as responding to a failure in previous philosophies of logic, including Kant’s, to address what McNulty calls (following Thomas Ricketts, 10) ‘the logocentric predicament’, which consists in the seeming difficulty of providing a rational justification of the validity of logical principles which is ‘non-circular’ in the sense of not already presupposing these same principles (44).
Beyond proposing this ‘metaphysics-first’ reading of the opening of the Logic (borrowing a phrase from Christopher Peacocke that McNulty himself alludes to; xvii, 27n37), McNulty also takes Hegel’s Logic to be responding to a general challenge (posed in different ways by Kant and various forms of ancient and modern skepticism) concerning how philosophy as such is supposed to begin. Drawing on a few remarks from the introductory sections of Hegel’s Logics, McNulty argues that Hegel means for being, as the starting-point of the Logic, to serve not just as the ‘pre-logical’ basis from which the traditional-logical material is to be explained and derived within the Logic, but also to serve as the absolutely ‘presuppositionless’ starting point for all of philosophy as such (43)—and so as also able to serve as the basis for explanation in the philosophy of nature and the philosophy of spirit as well. In McNulty’s words, being distinguishes itself by being the most ‘primitive concept’ (91), the ‘simplest concept’ (120), and the only one that ‘explains all others’, rather than vice versa (92). Beginning with being thus allows Hegel’s philosophy in general to be ‘presuppositionless’ in the ‘conceptual’ sense of not beginning with something the understanding of which presupposes that we first or already understand something else.
To round out being’s status of explanatory priority, McNulty portrays Hegel as appealing to two further special features: first, its ‘comprehensiveness’, in that being encompasses everything within itself, as a ‘whole’; secondly, its being inconceivable that being itself not be ‘instantiated’ (98), i.e., that being is ‘necessarily non-empty’ (95). McNulty takes the latter feature in particular to allow the Logic’s starting-point to avoid having to deal with skeptical or Kantian challenges concerning a possible gap between thinking of something, in the sense of having a concept or idea or thought in mind, and knowing this something to exist, since, with being, Hegel has on hand an ‘ontological argument’ which closes just this gap (29f, 105f, 157, etc.).
With its metaphysics-first approach to logic, and its positioning of being as providing a presuppositionless beginning to philosophy in general, and perhaps especially its foregrounding of an ‘ontological argument’ concerning being’s necessary instantiation, McNulty recognizes that his interpretive approach to the Logic might seem to saddle Hegel with some version of classical rationalism and its thesis of a necessary correspondence of thinking and being. In this regard, a striking feature of McNulty’s interpretation—and one he himself openly advertises—is that, on his reading, Hegel’s metaphysics does in fact ‘follow’ rationalism much more closely than others might allow (38). Moreover, McNulty claims explicitly that Hegel ‘does not follow Kant’ in ‘claiming that the older ontology erred because of its transcendental realism, the naive belief that we can know things as they are in themselves’ (101).
Nevertheless, McNulty judges Hegel’s fit with the ‘Leibniz-Wolffian’ version of rationalism to be imperfect, primarily due to Hegel’s more ‘monistic’ commitment to the ‘comprehensiveness’ of being, and in particular, to its standing as a ‘whole’ which comprises everything (92f). For this reason, McNulty sees Hegel’s vision of the correspondence of thinking and being on display in the ‘ontological argument’ for being that McNulty finds at the outset of Hegel’s Logic (and philosophy) as instead drawing Hegel’s rationalism much closer to a modified Spinozism (164).
McNulty takes Hegel’s Logic to be distinguished even from monistic rationalist metaphysics, however, by the ‘dialectical’ methodology by which the Logic moves forward from being on to the later ‘categories’ (as McNulty consistently refers to them; cf. ix–xvi, 1–3, etc.). This method is something McNulty takes the Logic to share with the earlier Phenomenology(36f), and to contrast especially sharply with earlier rationalist attempts at metaphysical derivation or explanation, at least in the sense familiar from the mos geometricos of Spinoza or Descartes (113). In fact, rather than beginning with definitions or axioms concerning being which are ‘secure’ or ‘self-evident’, and which could then serve as a basis for definitions of further terms or deductions of further theorems, the first sections of Hegel’s Logic show instead that being is something not only ‘insecure’ (91) but also ultimately ‘incoherent’ (97) and even ‘self-contradictory’ (120).
For McNulty, the first dialectical step in the Logic thus aims to show that being is not only not primitively intelligible, but that it is primitively un-intelligible. More specifically, the ‘definition’ Hegel gives of being at the outset quickly shows itself to not be ‘coherent’, since it seems that there could not ‘be’ being simpliciter, as being ‘would be so devoid of determinate properties as to be indistinguishable from nothing’, and so indistinguishable from not-being (100). Hence, despite its seeming to serve as the ‘conceptually primitive’ (and in this sense ‘presuppositionless’) starting point, being turns out to dissolve itself: ‘no sooner than [being] is introduced it is overturned and its opposite [i.e., nothing] adopted’ (91).
Put this way, the immediate dialectical dissolution of being might seem to leave (quite literally) nothing in its place and hence nothing to move forward with or from. McNulty, however, sees the next step of the Logic as making evident that this movement from being to nothing is not purely negative, but instead is something that gives rise, not to nothing simpliciter, but to nothing considered as a new ‘category’—one, moreover, which is actually a more ‘refined’ version of being itself, yet one which is thought not to succumb to the same contradictions which afflict being (101), and in fact is seemingly able to ‘resolve’ them (100). To be sure, in the subsequent step, the category of nothing itself then dialectically evinces new incoherences and self-contradictions; yet this too yields a new category (what Hegel calls ‘becoming’), one that is a still further ‘refined’ version of being itself, albeit one which now incorporates nothing as well (163).
On McNulty’s reading, it is through further iterations of this ‘dialectical’ process of ‘refining’ what was there initially, with being itself at the starting point of the Logic, that Hegel eventually means to ‘explain’ all of the later categories, on the basis of the exhibition of the incoherences and contradictions in previous ones, and in particular how he means eventually to derive and deduce the traditional logical principles themselves. Hence, rather than providing a linear construction of definitions of the elements of the traditional logic (viz. concepts, judgments, inferences) from combinations of even more simple ontological concepts (à la Leibnizianism), Hegel’s definition of what it is to be, e.g., a concept is explained instead by seeing the category of ‘concept’ as following ‘dialectically’ from the failures and incoherences in being itself, such that the category of being a concept is a later-stage attempt to further resolve the contradictions inherent in being itself.
3. Worries about McNulty’s interpretation
Let me now raise concerns about the viability of McNulty’s reading, some of which pertain to features specific to McNulty’s reading, and others of which pertain to the broader family of ‘metaphysical’ cum ‘presuppositionless’ readings with which McNulty himself rightly sees close kinship (24; cf. Houlgate 2006 and 2022).
A first concern arises due to tension between the thesis that the Logic’s beginning is radically ‘presuppositionless’, while nevertheless also viewing Logic as from the start making use of a ‘method’ which is specifically ‘dialectical’. For one it makes it hard to see how the beginning is just simply: being—rather than: being, along with the application of the dialectical method to being. Perhaps McNulty means for the dialectical method to itself already be contained somewhere within pure being, such that it is being itself which is able to self-motor the dialectic along, as it were—though if this is McNulty’s considered view, it is neither articulated clearly as such, nor is it defended as itself either coherent conceptually or as textually necessary. For another, the more the beginning itself becomes: being along with the dialectic, the less obvious it is that the presence of the dialectic doesn’t itself smuggle in, at the outset, in the allegedly pre-logical ‘Doctrine of Being’, exactly those traditional-logical principles which are, according to McNulty’s own interpretation, only later to be explained, derived, or deduced, in the subsequent ‘Doctrine of the Concept’, on pain of circularity.
This tension comes closer to the surface once we hear more about how McNulty means to spell out the work of the dialectic itself. On McNulty’s reading, the dialectic takes place in two steps: ‘immanent critique’ and ‘determinate negation’ (121). Immanent critique takes a given ‘category’ (other times also referred to as a ‘concept’) as ‘both the object and standard of evaluation’, and then ‘show[s]’ this category ‘to be untrue’ in the sense of being ‘self-contradictory’ (122). Next, the category in question is ‘determinately negat[ed]’, not just via an absolute negation or wholesale dismissal of the category, but via a negating that aims to ‘resolve the contradiction’ at hand, and to arrive at ‘a new concept that is contradiction-free’, but which is (again) ‘a refined version of the old’ (122).
Philosophically, we might well wonder how mere being could be responsible for ‘immanently critiquing’ itself, for ‘determinately negating’ itself, for further ‘refining’ itself through ‘the dialectic’, and so on. Indeed, we might wonder how being, all on its own, is even able to make itself into an object at all—let alone be the sort of thing that relates to standards, takes itself as a standard for its own being, compares itself as object with itself as standard, etc.
Matters become even more vexed once we allow McNulty to further clarify the specific ‘standard’ that immanent critique applies—namely, the standard of ‘truth’, which itself ‘minimally. . .requires the absence of contradiction’ (120). Again it is unclear what it could mean for being simpliciter to even be able to ‘contradict itself’—since this would seem to require, minimally, the power to not just relate to itself as object, but to say or predicate something of itself (so as to also be able to contra-‘dict’ itself, as a special case). These issues become still more serious for McNulty in light of his ambition to see Hegel as offering, at the outset, an ‘ontological argument’ for being’s necessary non-emptiness, and then as using this to respond to the ‘logocentric predicament’. The ‘ontological argument’ for the necessity of being’s being instantiated seems itself to depend on the validity of the principle of non-contradiction, that a contradictory state of affairs (here: being’s not-being) necessarily cannot obtain. And then by lodging non-contradictoriness as a ‘standard’ already within mere being, it seems no longer possible to argue that ‘the Doctrine of Being’ doesn’t already presuppose that its subject-matter must ‘adhere to as minimal a logical principle as the law of noncontradiction’ (203; cf 186ff).
The main culprit here seems to be McNulty’s desire to respect the strong emphasis that has been given by earlier ‘metaphysical’ interpreters (such as Houlgate) to a handful of remarks in the introductory sections of the Logics, which suggest that the Logic will be in some sense ‘presuppositionless’, along with McNulty’s sympathy for their fairly radical gloss on the specific sense of ‘presuppositionlessness’ at issue. Beyond the conceptual dead-ends to which this interpretive hypothesis seems inevitably to lead, there are independent textual reasons for McNulty to forgo these allegiances. For one thing, there are only a very small number of remarks which might be (though need not be) taken to suggest an austere absence of presuppositions for the Logic (McNulty himself cites only one; 43). For another, there are a sizeable number of other passages (present in both Logics) in which Hegel fairly clearly and directly identifies several kinds of presuppositions which he openly affirms to be at work as his Logic begins. One collection of such passages has Hegel telling his readers that the whole movement of the Logic gets started, not with being simpliciter, but rather by ‘the decision to want to think purely’ (cf. Enz §78; compare Koch 2022). Another collection of passages has Hegel telling his readers that he is assuming the ‘result’ of the Phenomenology of Spirit—namely, that the concept of ‘absolute knowing’ had been dialectically ‘deduced’ as necessarily taking the form of ‘science’, understood as an activity performed by ‘absolute spirit’, such that the task of the Logic is not merely to try to think purely in general but to use pure thinking to begin to ‘comprehend’ absolute knowing (compare Bowman 2019).
Now, even if McNulty were to restrict himself to taking seriously the first kind of presupposition of the Logic, he would have more resources available to account for what is responsible for the work of the dialectic: rather than seeing this as performed by being all by itself, it could now be ascribed to the activity of thinking purely about being. Similarly, the account of why the Logic must begin with being could then also appeal to independent requirements implied by the decision to want to ‘think purely’, to justify why such thinking must begin with being. Finally, the few passages in which Hegel ascribes a kind of presuppositionlessness to the Logic could then be understood as pertaining to the absence of presuppositions, at the outset, about the precise nature of the path which will be necessary for pure thinking to run its course and for the relevant intention to be fulfilled, about whether pure thinking of mere being will be able to demonstrate that this fulfills or fully satisfies the relevant intention, and so on.
To be sure, this alternative reframing would force McNulty to give up on the idea that Hegel’s Logic means to escape ‘logocentrism’, since this reframing has Hegel presupposing the presence of the subject-matter of traditional logic—namely, the activity of thinking—right from the start. In this regard, it is thus striking that McNulty himself is emphatic in rejecting the idea that Hegel’s Logic means to presuppose either the activity of thinking or even a ‘thinker’ qua thinking subject (58).
Even so, this alternative reframing would allow McNulty to more openly embrace Hegel’s own consistent characterization of each of the items of the Logic as ‘thought-determinations’, something that McNulty himself concedes at various points (cf. 1–2, 50), but which he also counsels ‘cannot be taken at face value’ (59). It would also let McNulty off the hook from trying to avoid characterizing Logic’s early ‘Doctrines’ as already, in some sense, trafficking in ‘concepts’, and fit better with his own vocabulary which, on many occasions throughout his book, refers to the Logic’s early elements as ‘concepts’ and ‘categories’ (as noted above).
It is worth mentioning, in closing, that McNulty’s resistance to framing the Logic in terms of pure thinking seems to have a second, distinct impetus. Especially in the early Chapters, McNulty highlights Hegel’s criticisms of Kant’s conception of logic, arguing not only that Hegel sees Kant as failing in general to be sufficiently ‘presuppositionless’, but also Hegel’s more specific criticism that Kant makes the subject-matter of logic too ‘psychological’ (39), by seeing logic as dealing with thinking qua act and with the content of consciousness and self-consciousness (‘apperception’). While these passages might be of use for criticizing the influential attempt by Robert Pippin to interpret Hegel’s Logic as continuing to work broadly within Kant’s own ‘apperception problematic’ (compare Pippin 2018), they do not entail that Hegel rejects the idea that the Logic essentially involves, and is about, thinking in some other sense of the term (compare Tolley 2018).
It would seem, furthermore, that we are given a substantial clue as to the relevant alternative sense of thinking which transcends traditional conceptions of consciousness, but which would nevertheless be relevant to logic, by way of the second ‘presupposition’ Hegel identifies—namely, Logic’s presupposition of the ‘result’ of the Phenonenology, understood as the derivation and justification of the ‘concept’ of ‘absolute knowing’ as the work of ‘absolute spirit’ (what religion represents as ‘God’) manifest in ‘science’. The Phenomenology already demonstrated the inability of mere consciousness or self-consciousness to suffice for the definition of absolute knowing (‘science’). The Logic presupposes the dialectical derivation of the concept of science itself, and then sets itself the task, not just of pure thinking in general, but specifically pure thinking about the Phenomenology’s ‘concept’ of absolute knowing. As Hegel puts it at the outset of the Encyclopedia as a whole, the task of the Logic is to engage in pure thinking which has ‘the truth’ as its ‘object’—and moreover, ‘truth in the highest sense’, i.e., ‘in the sense that God is the truth and God alone is the truth’—so as to ‘comprehend’ this truth (Enz §1).
McNulty acknowledges that Hegel does talk as if the ‘definition of the Absolute’ is the true task of the Logic (28)—though, due to his other interpretive commitments, he demotes these passages, and opts (following Koch) to take the relevant series of propositions (‘the Absolute is being’, ‘the Absolute is nothing’, etc.) to be able to express only ‘dummy-propositions’ (cf. 125–6; 113), since they do not (in his view) get to the heart of the deepest work being done in the Logic. This is, of course, understandable from the point of view of McNulty’s own preferred framing of Hegel’s intentions to escape the ‘logocentric-predicament’, which prohibits propositional (‘predicative’) form itself from being in any way presupposed at the outset of the Doctrine of Being (cf. 125, 138). Yet once we give up on the idea that the Logic means primarily to escape logocentrism, then we are free to accept Hegel’s own affirmations (begrudgingly noted by McNulty himself) that the Logic presupposes that its task, from the start, is to think, to think purely, and to think purely specifically about ‘the truth in the highest sense’.
REFERENCES
Bowman, Brady. 2019. ‘Zum Verhältnis von Hegels Wissenschaft der Logik zur Phänomenologie des Geistes in der Gestalt von 1807’, Hegel-Studien, Beiheft 67: 1–42.
Hegel, GWF. (‘Enz’) Enzyklopädie der philosophischen Wissenschaften im Grundrisse, 3rd ed, 1830. Volume 20, Gesammelte Werke, Meiner, 1992.
Houlgate, Stephen. 2006. The Opening of Hegel’s Logic. Purdue.
---. 2022. Hegel on Being. Bloomsbury.
Koch, Anton. 2022. ‘Hegel’s Parmenidean Descent to the Science Without Contrary’, Hegel-Studien, Band 56: 65–96.
Pippin, Robert. 2018. Hegel’s Realm of Shadows. Chicago.
Tolley, Clinton. 2018. ‘Hegel’s Conception of Thinking in his Logics’, Logic from Kant to Russell, ed. S. Lapointe. Routledge: 73–100.