The hylomorphic notion that natural objects are best conceived as composites of matter and form, where form explains what makes a particular object the object that it is, has been receiving fresh attention in some quarters of contemporary philosophy. Yet hylomorphism remains a neglected topic in many philosophy departments, and its genealogy is seldom considered. The History of Hylomorphism, which gathers essays from experts in the fields of ancient and medieval philosophy, addresses an important need. I hope that many philosophers—not just historians—will read it, for it offers something more than a scholarly exploration of a niche topic: it demonstrates how the history of hylomorphism has shaped how the ‘Mind-Body problem’ is formulated by philosophers today. It may even point the way towards a possible solution.
Yet I can anticipate a number of (bad) excuses which analytic philosophers, such as myself, might be tempted to make for passing over a volume like this one. Here are two that I’ve heard before. Some will complain, rather flippantly, that the term ‘hylomorphism’ is merely a neologism of the nineteenth century, rather than an ancient idea with a history, so this volume proceeds from a false premise. (If so, how embarrassing!) Others may grant that hylomorphism has a long history, but will claim it is merely a historical curiosity of small relevance to philosophers today. (In that case, why bother?) If someone with such misgivings were to study the essays comprising this volume, they might gain a few reasons to think otherwise. One service I can perform, then, is to reflect on a few of those reasons here.
With regard to the first misgiving, although the term ‘hylomorphism’ did not appear in Anglophone philosophy until the late nineteenth century (via Martineau's A Study of Religion published in 1888), and there is no single theory to which it refers, this diachronic study successfully picks out a family of ideas that share a common patrimony in Aristotle’s theory of composite objects. Aristotle ‘clearly thought of forms and matter as, in some way “parts” of the composite object’ (2) and took them to be ‘explanatorily more basic than the objects of which they are, in some way, “parts”’ (3). Hylomorphism is not concerned (merely) with the Special Composition Question. Hylomorphists have deployed analyses of objects in terms of matter and form to answer a variety of questions, such as: what makes this object a human as distinct from a horse; or, a unity as distinct from an aggregate; or, this human as opposed to some other human? Beginning with Aristotle’s theory (Ch. 1), which has been variously interpreted, The History of Hylomorphism traces both the influence and transformation of his ideas within the philosophy of: the Stoics and Epicureans (Chs. 1, 2 & 3), Alexander of Aphrodisias (Chs. 4, 6, 7, 10), Galen (Ch. 5), Plotinus (Ch. 8), Philoponus (Ch. 10 & 11), Pseudo-Simplicius (Ch. 11), Avicenna (Ch. 12), Averroes (Ch. 13), Aquinas (Ch. 14), and Suarez (Ch. 15). It was Suarezian hylomorphism which was in the crosswires when Descartes conceived his radical form of mind-body dualism (Ch.16). The word ‘Hylomorphism’ (or ‘hylemorphism’) is a composite of the Greek words hyle (matter) and morphê (form), and it is true that Aristotle never used it. But this study shows how Aristotle’s account of objects in terms of matter and form took root in the work of the Commentators, proliferated among the medievals, and was opposed by early moderns like Descartes. In the course of doing so, it also shows how the history of these ideas has shaped the philosophy we do today in important ways.
This brings me to the second misgiving. I expect many philosophers of mind would be willing to concede, on deliberation, that a diachronic study of this kind might ‘enable us to see more clearly how our own philosophical tradition has developed, how certain questions came to be the ones which preoccupy us today’ (vii). Yet it is clear that the editor and several contributors to this volume believe that such studies can offer something more substantive to the debate: ‘they can also point to major assumptions and mistakes. . .made along the way’ (vii). From the editor’s (Charles’s) perspective, Aristotle held a view of the psychological which circumvents the Mind-Body problem with which we are familiar. According to this interpretation, psychological beings are embodied, psycho-physical wholes which have forms that determine the matter they contain in their definitions. Philosophers of mind today, however, be they dualists or physicalists, have assumed a post-Cartesian framework that is antithetical to hylomorphism: they define psychological beings in terms of ‘purely mental’ and ‘purely physical’ properties, which lack any reference to a psycho-physical whole, and they conceive matter in terms of determinate constituents, leaving form with no role to play. This interpretation of Aristotle’s hylomorphism, which is elaborated in Charles’s earlier monograph (Charles, 2021), induces one possible reading of the history disclosed in this volume: matter and form, which had been held together in Aristotle’s hylomorphism, were pulled apart in the course of subsequent developments.
On the one side were philosophers who sought to enhance the ontological status of matter by attributing to it a more determinate reality, defined independently of form. The Epicureans (Alexander Bown, Ch. 1) and the Stoics (Brad Inwood, Ch. 2), along with the physician and philosopher Galen (Patricia Marechal, Ch. 5), all posited the existence of basic material bodies as the building blocks of nature. Like Aristotle, they regarded the principles of change as being immanent within matter. Although the Stoics retained a role for the soul (conceived as a kind of body) in bringing about the existence of a soul-body composite (Christof Rapp, Ch. 3) and Galen posited a Divine Craftsman who combines matter in various ways (Marechal, Ch. 5), these accounts dispensed with Aristotelian forms. They provoked reactions from Aristotelians such as Dicaearchus, who conceived the soul as a property of the body, and Andronicus, who conceived the soul as a power which follows a certain mixture of matter (Inwood, Ch. 2). In particular, they were a foil for the hylomorphism of Alexander of Aphrodisias, who claimed that Stoic accounts of blending could not account for the unity of composites (Reier Helle, Ch. 4). Nonetheless, whilst Alexander sought to restore the unifying and joint-carving roles of form, it appears that he wished to retain a determinate conception of matter. He conceived the soul as a kind of emergent capacity (Victor Caston, Ch. 6), adopting a layered vision of reality in which souls have no separate being apart from embodied existence (Frans A. J. de Haas, Ch. 7).
On the other side were philosophers who elevated the ontological status of forms by conceiving them as existing independently of matter. Plotinus, like Aristotle, believed that forms are (in some sense) prior to bodies, but inferred they should therefore be defined without reference to matter (Riccardo Chiaradonna, Ch. 8). He was committed to an account of freedom he judged to be inconsistent with the idea of an essentially embodied intellect. We also learn of various attempts to solve the problem of how an immaterial intellect could influence bodily activities (Pauliina Remes, Ch. 9). Philoponus, according to one interpretation, conceived perception as a purely psychological activity (Richard Sorabji, Ch. 10). On another reading, Philoponus maintained a hylomorphic account of such processes but affirmed the existence of a non-bodily intellect, whilst Pseudo-Simplicius thought of intellect as being operative at every level even though it is separable from the body (Miira Tuominen, Ch. 11). For Avicenna, forms do not emerge from matter but originate from the ‘Active Intellect’, a separate substance which imposes form upon matter (Peter Adamson, Ch. 12). Averroes denied that any part of a human is essentially unembodied, but outsourced intellectual activity to a ‘Potential Intellect’, which is one and the same for all humans (Stephen Ogden, Ch. 13). Aquinas insisted humans are in fact capable of doing their own thinking, and conceived the soul as a determinate individual whose intellectual basis is not defined in terms of matter (Christopher Shields, Ch. 14).
In Suarez, the instinct to reify matter and the impulse to dematerialise form were finally conjoined: in his adaptation of hylomorphism, matter and form are both determinate individuals which interact with one another in complex ways (Dominik Perler, Ch. 15). It was this version of hylomorphism, we learn, which Descartes had in mind when he stripped nature of every form, save the soul, defining matter independently of form and conceiving souls as immaterial substances (Lili Alanen, Ch. 16). From the editor’s perspective, the history of hylomorphism is marred by a litany of innovations which compromised Aristotle’s original vision. It was a mistake, on the one hand, to think of matter as some kind of determinate stuff from which living beings might be said to emerge, instead of thinking of matter as being ‘something abstracted from the natural, teleologically defined substances which we encounter’ in nature (20). And it was a mistake, on the other hand, to suppose that form should be defined independently of matter, transforming hylomorphism back into ‘the two component picture it was initially constructed to oppose’ (40). By abandoning Aristotle’s view of living beings as inextricably psycho-physical wholes, these innovators ‘paved the way for Descartes to raise his mind-body problem in the form which still perplexes us’ (39). At least, that is the story Charles wishes to tell.
I do not mean to suggest, however, that this thought-provoking appraisal of the development of hylomorphism is shared by all (or even by most) of this volume’s contributors.[1] Helle, for instance, defends the resilience of Stoic philosophy against Alexander’s criticisms whilst calling the virtues of his own version of hylomorphism into question (Ch. 4). Ogden argues for the feasibility of a more ‘liberal’ hylomorphism; one which might admit the existence of hylomorphic wholes that are not substances (Ch. 13). And Shields offers a subtle and intriguing account of Aquinas’s conception of the soul as a determinate individual (a this something, or hoc aliquid), which may deflect some of the suspicion that he is offering a two-component conception of a human being that opens the door to Cartesian dualism (Ch. 14)—especially when we recall that Aquinas conceived matter as merely a determinable potentiality. One wonders what contemporary scholars of Ockham and Scotus might have had to say in defence of their causes too. It is surprising that so much space in this volume was allocated to the Stoics and Epicureans, who were not hylomorphists, whilst so little was given to medieval philosophers of the Latin West, many of whom played a significant part in the development of hylomorphism. It is disappointing that The History of Hylomorphism entirely omits the earlier part of the Latin Middle Ages.[2]
In recommending this book to my colleagues, nonetheless, I must qualify the degree to which I think a diachronic study of this kind can establish the relevance of hylomorphism for philosophers today. Charles believes that philosophy of mind has crashed, so to speak, because of a bug which Descartes introduced in the system. He invites us to consider how Aristotelians might have resisted the historical moves which made modern philosophy susceptible to this bug. Hylomorphism offers the tools for constructing an alternative to current views in the philosophy of mind; one in which human beings and animals are conceived of as psycho-physical wholes. My own work on hylomorphism began, however, in the attempt to use hylomorphic ideas to explain such holistic phenomena as quantum entanglement (Simpson 2021, 2023), and although I am optimistic that some version of hylomorphism can be applied fruitfully to contemporary physics, I am doubtful that the physical properties of the parts of a psycho-physical whole are merely abstractions from the properties of the whole, as Charles has suggested (Simpson & Koons 2024). There is much within quantum physics which would have surprised the Stagirite. Nonetheless, I do perceive a need for collaboration between ancient and contemporary philosophers, if we are going to dig modern philosophy out of its deepest ruts. And if my readers are sympathetic to such a suggestion, then gaining some familiarity with The History of Hylomorphism might be a good place to start.
REFERENCES
Charles, D., (2021). The Undivided Self: Aristotle and the ‘Mind-Body’ Problem. Oxford University Press.
Simpson, W. M. R. (2021). ‘Cosmic Hylomorphism: a Powerist Ontology of Quantum Mechanics’, European Journal for the Philosophy of Science, 11, 28.
Simpson, W. M. R. (2023), ‘Small Worlds with Cosmic Powers’, Journal of Philosophy, 120(8).
Simpson, W. M. R. & Koons, R. C. (2024), ‘The Entanglement Problem for Psychological Hylomorphism’, work in progress, intended for Res Philosophica.