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Law is a Moral Practice

2024-04-10T17:36:00-0400

2024.04.2 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Scott Hershovitz, Law is a Moral Practice, Harvard University Press, 2023, 236pp., $39.95 (hbk), ISBN 9780674258556.

Reviewed by Brian Leiter, University of Chicago

In the first chapter of his often entertaining but rather exasperating book, Scott Hershovitz gives two different formulations of its central thesis that “law is a moral practice.” In one formulation, “legal practices—like legislation and adjudication—are the sorts of activities that might, in the right circumstances, rearrange people’s moral relationships. That is what I mean when I say that law is a moral practice” (28, emphasis added; cf. 132). This view, however, is trivially true: all kinds of practices (not just legal ones) “might, in the right circumstances” change our moral relationships with each other. (If my neighbor regularly leaves garbage on my lawn, this will change our moral relationship, e.g., I will be morally justified in bringing a civil action against him, and I...

The Rules of Rescue: Cost, Distance, and Effective Altruism

2024-04-04T11:51:00-0400

2024.04.1 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Theron Pummer, The Rules of Rescue: Cost, Distance, and Effective Altruism, Oxford University Press, 2023, 253pp., $32.99 (hbk), ISBN 9780190884147.

Reviewed by Violetta Igneski, McMaster University

Theron Pummer’s book, The Rules of Rescue: Cost, Distance, and Effective Altruism, provides a thoroughly engaging discussion of the moral reasons and requirements we have to use our time and resources to help others. After quickly dismissing act consequentialism for its implausibility and inability to accommodate moral permissions and constraints, Pummer constructs a nonconsequentialist picture that relies heavily on intuitive responses to a series of stylized examples. His account then goes further by offering a coherent set of explanations for these intuitive responses. While these explanations are of limited value to those who do not share Pummer’s intuitions, or to those with limited patience for hypothetical cases, the examples serve an important function in isolating various salient considerations and assessing their moral significance. The main...

Splitsville USA: A Democratic Argument for Breaking Up the United States

2024-02-29T13:54:00-0500

2024.02.1 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Christopher F. Zurn, Splitsville USA: A Democratic Argument for Breaking Up the United States, Routledge, 2023, 215pp., $48.95 (pbk), ISBN 9781032429793.

Reviewed by Peter Stone, Trinity College Dublin

The idea of breaking up the United States is today mostly confined to the lunatic fringe—to the likes of Rep. Marjorie Taylor Greene (R-GA), for example (McCann Ramirez 2023). Christopher Zurn seeks to change that. His new book, Splitsville USA: A Democratic Argument for Breaking Up the United States, endeavours to move the idea into mainstream U.S. political discourse. In doing so, Zurn has performed a valuable service. When Greene says something that sounds stupid, it’s hard to tell if it is the source or the idea itself that is the problem. Zurn’s book, however, offers a more mature and sophisticated defence of the idea than anything Greene is capable of producing. If the idea still sounds bad—and trust me, it does—you can be sure...

Ontology and Oppression: Race, Gender, and Social Reality

2024-01-22T18:09:24-0500

2024.01.5 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Katharine Jenkins, Ontology and Oppression: Race, Gender, and Social Reality, Oxford University Press, 2023, 268pp., $29.95 (pbk), ISBN 9780197666784.

Reviewed by Charlotte Witt, University of New Hampshire

Katharine Jenkins has artfully stitched together a radically pluralist account of human social kinds using materials drawn from recent work in analytic feminist metaphysics. If the reader is interested in an overview of recent developments in social ontology, Jenkins’ book would be a good place to start. In addition, Jenkins identifies and defines two novel kinds of ontological wrongs, namely ontic injustice and ontic oppression, a species of ontic injustice. Jenkins argues that an individual can be the victim of ontic injustice simply in virtue of being a member of a social kind when the constraints and enablements which constitute (or partially constitute) the kind are wrongful to the individual (3, 46). Borrowing an idea from Jean Hampton (1991), Jenkins argues that kind membership can...

The Tangle of Science: Reliability Beyond Method, Rigour, and Objectivity

2024-01-22T18:05:47-0500

2024.01.4 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Nancy Cartwright, Jeremy Hardie, Eleonora Montuschi, Matthew Soleiman, and Ann C. Thresher, The Tangle of Science: Reliability Beyond Method, Rigour, and Objectivity, Oxford University Press, 2023, 272pp., $41.99 (hbk), ISBN 9780198866343.

Reviewed by Lydia Patton, Virginia Tech

The value of science is difficult to pin down. Two competing strands of philosophy do this work. One is the study of confirmation and truth, encompassing formal epistemology, philosophy of science, and allied fields. Another is the study of epistemic and non-epistemic values in science. The Tangle of Science occupies a liminal space between these two projects. The authors note (9) that the work of Naomi Oreskes, Helen Longino, Karin Knorr Cetina, and Philip Kitcher lives in the same neighborhood as Tangle: investigating why we place such high value on science, and what backs up that value in practice. The authors further cite Bernard Williams, Otto Neurath, Pierre Duhem, and W.V.O. Quine as forebears, and Alison Wylie, Hasok Chang, and Andrea Woody as contemporaries working...

The Future of the World Is Open: Encounters with Lea Melandri, Luisa Muraro, Adriana Cavarero, and Rossana Rossanda

2024-01-20T12:51:00-0500

2024.01.3 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Elevira Roncalli (ed), The Future of the World Is Open: Encounters with Lea Melandri, Luisa Muraro, Adriana Cavarero, and Rossana Rossanda, SUNY Press, 2022, 189pp., $33.95 (pbk), ISBN 9781438489148.

Reviewed by Chiara Bottici, The New School

The book contains three interviews conducted with major figures of the Italian feminist movement of the 1970s, along with some essays by Rossana Rossanda, who belongs to an older generation. Lea Melandri’s thought embodies a form of feminism nourished by activism within first the anti-authoritarian movement of 1960s and then within the women’s movement of the 1970s. Luisa Muraro’s thought situates itself within the tradition of sexual difference feminism (femminismo della differenza), which has been very influential in Italy, and which Melandri criticizes in her interview, thus setting up a nice dialogue between the two voices. Finally, Adriana Cavarero, despite her experience in the same Diotima’s group as Muraro, embodies an original feminist thought that enriches the feminist critique of the universal subject of western...

Aristotle, De Motu Animalium: a new critical edition of the Greek text

2024-01-20T12:50:00-0500

2024.01.2 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Aristotle, De Motu Animalium: a new critical edition of the Greek text by Oliver Primavesi, with an English translation by Ben Morison, and an Introduction by Christof Rapp and Oliver Primavesi, Oxford University Press, 2023, 238pp., $70.00 (hbk), ISBN 9780198874461.

Reviewed by Pavel Gregoric, Institute of Philosophy, Zagreb, Croatia

Aristotle’s De motu animalium (MA) is a short treatise, interesting both philosophically and textually. Philosophically, it will be intriguing to most readers because it contains Aristotle’s answer to the question of how the soul moves the body. Very briefly, mental states that represent desired or unwanted things are alterations in the central organ accompanied by microscopic heatings or coolings which are converted into mechanical impulses that spread from the central organ and cause the limbs to move. The hard problem is, of course, to determine what makes alterations in the central organ’s mental states, but that is something Aristotle has already settled in the treatise De anima, or so he believes. In MA he simply assumes that mental states “immediately have their being as alterations...

Laisser être et rendre puissant

2024-01-20T12:48:00-0500

2024.01.1 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Tristan Garcia, Laisser être et rendre puissant, Presses Universitaires de France, 2023, 568pp., €29.90 (pbk), ISBN 9782130798941.

Reviewed by Oliver Feltham, American University of Paris

Tristan Garcia is a well-known novelist and essayist in France, and he has made inroads into the realms of metaphysics, ontology, and aesthetics with a series of ambitious works. His latest book, Laisser être et rendre puissant presents itself as a work of both critical metaphysics and ethics. A literal translation of the title in English gives us ‘Let be and make powerful’ which sounds like the second album of a dark metal band from Shropshire, but that should not dissuade the reader. For all its novelty and efforts to catalogue and dismiss all rival ontological and ethical orientations, however, the book ends up giving liberalism a fresh coat of paint.

The book starts with an account of ubiquitous conflict between human beings, a little...

Analytic Philosophy and Human Life

2023-12-29T13:29:00-0500

2023.12.3 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Thomas Nagel, Analytic Philosophy and Human Life, Oxford University Press, 2023, 291pp., $29.95 (hbk), ISBN 9780197681671.

Reviewed by A.W. Moore, University of Oxford

This is a review of a book that itself consists mostly of reviews, between them covering a vast philosophical terrain. In writing it I have therefore had little choice, if not to adopt a view from nowhere, then at least to adopt a bird’s eye view. There are several major recurring themes in the book that are clearly visible from up there. In due course I shall focus on what I take to be the most prominent of these. But first I want to give some indication of the book’s scope and of why it is so engaging.

The reviews are divided into four parts. The titles of these four parts—‘Life and Death’, ‘Ethics’, ‘Moral Psychology’, and ‘Reality’—themselves bear witness to its scope. They are...

Rational Sentimentalism

2023-12-29T05:56:00-0500

2023.12.2 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Justin D’Arms and Daniel Jacobson, Rational Sentimentalism, Oxford University Press, 2023, 230pp., $80.00 (hbk), ISBN 9780199256402.

Reviewed by Jonas Olson, Stockholm University

Rational Sentimentalism is the product of a long-standing and productive collaboration between Justin D’Arms and Daniel Jacobson. The book is divided into three parts and nine chapters that span large territories in the philosophy of emotion and value, and related areas. In lieu of a chapter-by-chapter overview, here is an attempt at a brief summary of some of the book’s main messages: In thinking about values and reasons, philosophers have traditionally assumed a kind of hegemony of the moral, neglecting other kinds of values, such as the funny, the disgusting, and the fearsome. These are to be explained in terms of sentiments, i.e., dispositions to emotional responses, such as amusement, disgust, and fear. That is why the theory defended is a kind of sentimentalism. Philosophers’...

Heidegger in Ruins: Between Philosophy and Ideology

2023-12-01T10:14:00-0500

2023.12.1 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Richard Wolin, Heidegger in Ruins: Between Philosophy and Ideology, Yale University Press, 2023, 488pp., $38.00 (hbk), ISBN 9780300233186.

Reviewed by Emmanuel Faye, University of Rouen Normandie

Heidegger in Ruins is the culmination of a series of books, written over the course of three decades, that Richard Wolin has devoted to Martin Heidegger and his most prominent Jewish students. In the wake of the posthumous publication of the eight volumes of the Black Notebooks in Heidegger’s Complete Works, Wolin, like other interpreters before him, makes an important attempt to take stock of Heidegger’s work.

The book begins with “A Note on Sources,” where Wolin stresses the significance he ascribes to Heidegger’s correspondence. It should be noted, however, that he relies solely on the published correspondence and has not examined the now available handwritten sources. A substantial introduction entitled “Heidegger in Black” not only discusses the Black Notebooks, but also the 1934 seminar...

Determined: A Science of Life Without Free Will

2023-11-21T13:10:00-0500

2023.11.3 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Robert M. Sapolsky, Determined: A Science of Life Without Free Will, Penguin Press, 2023, 528pp., $35.00 (hbk), ISBN 9780525560975.

Reviewed by John Martin Fischer, University of California, Riverside

This is a big, splashy book, both in number of pages and ambitions. It is much ballyhooed, receiving reviews and attention throughout the Anglophone world. Sapolsky wishes to disabuse us of what he takes to be our false beliefs that we are free and morally responsible, and even active agents, three central and foundational aspects of human life and our navigation of it. Much of the book contains summaries (necessarily somewhat brief) of various scientific and mathematical fields (and sub-areas) relevant to his topics: neuroscience (the appendix is a “primer on neuroscience”), chaos theory, quantum mechanics, emergence, and some results from psychology and sociology.

It is a compendious book. The summaries will be helpful in bringing readers up to speed, or at least beginning that...

Putting Properties First: A Platonic Metaphysics for Natural Modality

2023-11-15T11:56:00-0500

2023.11.2 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Matthew Tugby, Putting Properties First: A Platonic Metaphysics for Natural Modality, Oxford University Press, 2022, 270pp., $90.00 (hbk), ISBN 9780198855101.

Reviewed by Gonzalo Rodriguez-Pereyra, University of Oxford

In this book Matthew Tugby offers a new theory of natural modality, where natural modality is understood to consist of those possibilities and necessities arising from the laws of nature and the behavioural dispositions of things (1). The basic idea in Tugby’s theory, Modal Platonism, is that the dispositions of things are grounded in relations of dispositional directedness between Platonic universals, i.e., universals that need not be instantiated in order to exist. For instance, the disposition to break of a fragile vase consists in its instantiating the universal fragility, which bears a relation of dispositional directedness to the universal breaking. Universals, for Tugby, have a non-dispositional, qualitative essence, and it is in virtue of these essences that relations of dispositional directedness exist between them. The...

Kommentare zu Aristoteles, ›De partibus animalium‹

2023-11-15T11:47:00-0500

2023.11.1 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Anonymous (Codex Hieros. S. S. 108) and Georgios Pachymeres, Eleni Pappa (ed.), Kommentare zu Aristoteles, ›De partibus animalium‹: Redaktionen zu Michael von Ephesos. Kritische Edition und Einleitung. De Gruyter, 2022, 375pp., $130.99 (hbk), ISBN 9783110708738.

Reviewed by Denis Walter, University of Bonn

The fourth volume of Commentaria in Aristotelem Graeca et Byzantina / Series Academica presents Eleni Pappa’s inaugural editions of two distinct redactions of the commentary written by Michael of Ephesus (11th–12th century AD) on Aristotle’s De Partibus Animalium (PA). One redaction of Michael’s text has an anonymous origin (transmitted in the 13th century Codex Hieros. S. S. 108), while the other, more recent one is attributed to Georgios Pachymeres (1242–ca. 1310). Michael’s work stands as the oldest Greek commentary on Aristotle’s De Partibus Animalium. Pappa’s edition consists of prolegomena divided into 8 chapters and the two edited texts.

The prolegomena of Pappa’s edition include a well-documented introduction to the problem, in which she begins by delving into matters related to the transmission of Michael’s commentary...

Law's Rule: The Nature, Value, and Viability of the Rule of Law

2023-10-29T19:48:00-0400

2023.10.5 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Gerald J. Postema, Law’s Rule: The Nature, Value, and Viability of the Rule of Law, Oxford University Press, 2022, 381pp., $120.00 (hbk), ISBN 9780190645342

Reviewed by Brad Hooker, University of Reading

Gerald Postema’s Law’s Rule provides a theory of the rule of law and addresses a number of challenges to the rule of law as a moral ideal. Those not familiar with philosophy of law might think that the rule of law consists merely in laws’ being generally followed and impartially enforced, thereby providing people with firm assurance about how others will behave, and thus a somewhat predictable social environment. Postema’s core idea is that the rule of law is instead a moral ideal that law provides protection and recourse against the arbitrary exercise of power. The book develops this core idea systematically, notes its conditions and limits, and discusses challenges to the rule of law. Nearly all the book’s arguments and explanations are clear, careful, and...

Ignorance: A Philosophical Study

2023-10-29T14:06:47-0400

2023.10.4 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Rik Peels, Ignorance: A Philosophical Study, Oxford University Press, 2023, 344pp., $83.00 (hbk), ISBN 9780197654514

Reviewed by Alessandra Tanesini, Cardiff University

Ignorance remains a neglected topic in analytic epistemology even though its study has spawned a whole interdisciplinary field generally known as agnotology. Arguably, Rik Peels has, over the years, been leading the attempt to remedy this lamentable situation. This book is the culmination of that work since it provides his epistemology of ignorance and shows how it can be applied to a range of issues of philosophical and social importance. In what follows I supply a selective overview of the main topics addressed in the book and briefly sketch three related worries about some of the views defended in the volume. Although I am critical of Peels’ fundamental methodological assumptions, one should not take these criticisms to imply a negative judgment about the value of...

What World Is This? A Pandemic Phenomenology

2023-10-24T06:48:00-0400

2023.10.3 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Judith Butler, What World Is This? A Pandemic Phenomenology, Columbia University Press, 2022, 144pp., $17.95 (pbk), ISBN 9780231208291

Reviewed by Joel Michael Reynolds, Georgetown University

The COVID-19 pandemic upended life across the globe. In the crossover book, What World Is This? A Pandemic Phenomenology, Judith Butler explores not just what happened, but what we ought to make of it. What are the ethical and political lessons this shared trauma offers and what do these lessons tell us both about how things are and also how they might be? Throughout, the inquiry weaves effortlessly between intellectual history, cultural critique, philosophical analysis, and political theory. As longtime readers of Butler will expect, their arguments ebb and flow around a host of rich, interlocking questions. The question in the title, What world is this? is expectedly primary, but a good deal of time is spent on more general questions like What is a world?...

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One True Logic: A Monist Manifesto

2023-10-17T19:15:00-0400

2023.10.2 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Owen Griffiths and A.C. Paseau, One True Logic: A Monist Manifesto, Oxford University Press, 2022, 272pp., $80.00 (hbk), ISBN 9780198829713.

Reviewed by Erik Stei, Utrecht University

Philosophers of logic have become increasingly interested in the question of how many of the multitude of available logics give a correct, or true, account of deductive validity. In their monograph One True Logic, Owen Griffiths and A.C. Paseau argue that the answer has to be: exactly one. They argue, further, that any candidate for the One True Logic (OTL) has to satisfy what they call the “L∞g∞s Hypothesis”: the OTL has to be maximally infinitary in the sense that it allows disjunctions and conjunctions over any number of formulas, as well as quantification over any number of argument places.

One True Logic is a bold and original book. Its discussion of foundational questions about logic is detailed and mathematically rigorous. At the same time,...

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Perceptual Experience

2023-10-03T10:38:00-0400

2023.10.1 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Christopher Hill, Perceptual Experience, Oxford University Press, 2022, 270pp., $90.00 (hbk), ISBN 9780192867766.

Reviewed by Matthew Fulkerson, University of California, San Diego

This book is a comprehensive account of perception that covers an impressive amount of territory. On the one hand it is incredibly ambitious and comprehensive. The range of issues covered is surprisingly wide. The book starts with foundational debates about representational content and defends accounts of the metaphysics of perceptual objects, introspection, pain, the demarcation problem, and the epistemology of perception, among many other topics. Any one of these issues could, and often has been, the subject of its own monograph. On the other hand, the book is a relatively compact read, and never feels bloated or overstuffed. The pacing here is comfortable, measured, and extremely well-organized. Each topic builds on the next, never getting bogged down in minutiae or buried under arcane discussions of...

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Selfless Minds: A Contemporary Perspective on Vasubandhu’s Metaphysics

2023-09-27T14:10:18-0400

2023.09.3 : View this Review Online | View Recent NDPR Reviews

Monima Chadha, Selfless Minds: A Contemporary Perspective on Vasubandhu’s Metaphysics, Oxford University Press, 2023, 222pp., $80.00 (hbk), ISBN 9780192844095.

Reviewed by Jay L Garfield, Smith College/ Harvard University

Monima Chadha has given the world of Anglophone philosophy more reason to take Indian Buddhist philosophy seriously in this closely argued study of the philosophy of the 4th century philosopher Vasubandhu, generally regarded as one of the founders (with his older brother Asaṅga) of the Yogācāra tradition, a tradition associated sometimes with idealism, and sometimes with phenomenology. However one reads the vast literature of this school—or, more specifically, the work of Vasubandhu himself—the close attention that Vasubandhu and his followers give to the philosophy of mind and the structure of subjectivity is inescapable and fascinating. Vasubandhu’s influence on subsequent Buddhist philosophy in India, Tibet, China, and beyond is incalculable, and he is surely one of the two or three most important philosophers in the Indian...

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