Notions of "reduction" have been a popular topic in analytic philosophy over the past century. I say "notions", in the plural, because the word 'reduction' is one of those notoriously ambiguous philosophical terms of art. It can stand for a semantic relation, where a reduction of A to B is a definition of A in terms of B. It can stand for a variety of explanatory relations, particularly part-whole explanations. It can be applied to identifications of objects in different domains of discourse. Sometimes, cases in which one theory replaces another are even said to involve "eliminative reductions". To complicate matters further, the term is entwined in conversations in a number of areas of philosophy: semantics, metaphysics, philosophy of mind, philosophy of science, and ethics. Even worse, the word has made its way into popular discussions of science and philosophy, where such distinctions are sometimes blurred, lost, or neglected.
As a result, discussions of things that go by the name of "reduction" are at substantial risk of confusion or crossed-purposes. A critic of one notion of "reduction" (e.g., definitional reduction) may actually be an advocate of another (say, part-whole explanation). And a writer who is not careful to specify what notion(s) of "reduction" she is defending or criticizing risks misleading or even baffling her readers.
This volume brings together a number of original essays by prominent philosophers of mind and philosophers of science. Broadly speaking, they are all concerned with the question of what to do with the word 'reduction', but explore different notions of "reduction" which they either support or criticize. The essays are independent of one another, though they cover some common ground, and so it is not quite a conversation. However, the volume does present a more or less state-of-the-art overview of where conversations about things called "reduction" are today in philosophy. I find myself at least partly wishing it could have been a longer volume, with the contributors commenting on one another's work. Nonetheless, this is a very useful volume for professional philosophers, useful for both graduate seminars and advanced undergraduate courses in philosophy of mind, philosophy of science, and metaphysics.
Some Background
The authors of the essays in this volume are all heir to several background conversations about reduction, and it is worth saying a word or two about these conversations by way of introduction. Through much of the twentieth century, the most influential notion of "reduction" was a semantic notion, introduced by logical positivists such as Rudolf Carnap. A semantic reduction of A to B is essentially a (re-)definition of A in terms of B. In its deeper history, this notion of reduction can be seen as stemming from the early modern project of trying to make science more like mathematics, with a small core of primitive definitions and axioms (self-evident truths of reason for the rationalists, simple ideas for the empiricists) from which everything else could be derived on the model of mathematical construction and proof. The logical positivists initially linked semantic reduction with the Verification Theory of Meaning (the thesis that a term is defined in terms of its verification conditions), the primitives being either sense data or terms in an object-language. Later versions of the theory tended to emphasize bridge laws connecting the reduced science (say, chemistry or biology) with the reducing science (say, physics). Semantic reductionism made its way into philosophy of mind in the form of logical behaviorism and analytic functionalism, and was the target of the anti-naturalisms of Moore and Hare in ethics. With the exception of some remaining analytic functionalists, it is a view with relatively few contemporary advocates.
A second notion of "reduction" finds its locus classicus in Oppenheim and Putnam's (1958) "Unity of Science as a Working Hypothesis". This type of reduction, which Oppenheim and Putnam called a micro-reduction, is not semantic in character. Rather, it is a form of explanation in which the properties of a complex object can be "reduced", in the sense of "completely explained", in terms of the interactions of the object's proper parts. (Or at least of things whose level of complexity is at a lower level, leaving open the question of whether there can be externalist micro-reductions.) Whereas Carnap's semantic reductionism was a kind of a priori canon about the language of science, Oppenheim and Putnam saw the micro-reducibility of the special sciences to physics as a kind of second-order empirical hypothesis. They further differentiated two sub-classes of micro-reductions: smooth or conservative reductions, in which the terms and laws of the reduced domain are preserved and explained, and eliminative reductions, in which the mature reducing science eliminates the need for the theoretical postulates of the reduced science. (One might think of this as "reducing" the ontology, not so much in the sense of breaking it down into constituents as of decreasing the number of scientific kinds.)
Oppenheim and Putnam did not go far in discussing the modal status of micro-reductions. However, micro-reductions have often been taken to be metaphysically necessary. That is, if A is micro-reducible to B, then B → A is metaphysically necessary, and A is metaphysically supervenient upon B. Moreover, it is often assumed that, because such reductions are supposed to be explanations, the necessity ought to be epistemically transparent. (If one makes this assumption, then successful micro-reductions will take on some of the features of semantic reductions: if A is micro-reducible to B, then one should be able to reconstruct the properties of objects in domain B out of the objects and properties of domain A. This produces something like a definition, though not a definition of the use of A-terms in ordinary language. However, reductions that require contingent bridge laws do not meet this test.)
Not all advocates of micro-reduction have viewed it as merely a working hypothesis. In philosophy of mind, in particular, one often still hears micro-reductionism voiced in distinctively normative tones. That is, unless the mind can be reduced to what the brain does, some dire consequences (such as ontological elimination) are said to follow. (See discussion in Stich and Lawrence (1994).) In the 1980s, indeed, it was a kind of orthodoxy that there is a forced choice between reduction and elimination. (For the most part, people have stopped calling Oppenheim and Putnam's "eliminative reductions" reductions.) In the 1990s, philosophers of mind became more concerned that there are mental phenomena (consciousness, qualia, first-person perspective, intentionality, normativity of belief) that cannot be reductively explained in terms of brain states, giving rise to discussions of this "explanatory gap" (Levine 1983) and a growing advocacy of property dualism and non-reductive physicalism. By this time, however, the philosophers of science had largely decided that complete inter-level reductions were in fact pretty rare. (See Horst 2007 for a discussion of the implications of post-reductionist philosophy of science for conversations in philosophy of mind.)
Type-Identity as a Reductionism
In undergraduate textbooks and courses in philosophy of mind, a rather different thesis, popular in the 1960s, is often characterized as "(classic) reductionism". This is the type-identity thesis, which claims that mentalistic types (like PAIN) are identical with physical or neural types (like C-FIBER FIRING). While some of the seminal discussions of type-identity were couched in terms of an empirical-sounding hypothesis that the thesis would prove true, type-identity is at its core a metaphysical claim, and seems to have arisen within philosophy of mind, unlike semantic and micro-reduction, which had their origins in philosophy of science. Unlike micro-reduction, type-identity is a biconditional relation: if pains and C-fiber firings are type-identical, then X is a pain if and only if it is a C-fiber firing.
Type-identity, like logical behaviorism, is often covered in philosophy of mind courses as an unsuccessful view whose better insights were appropriated by functionalism. Indeed, functionalism is often touted as having vanquished type-identity theory, through pointing out that there are legitimate scientific kinds -- those that are functionally-defined -- that are multiply realizable. Human hearts are structurally different from earthworm hearts and artificial hearts, and are made of very different types of stuff from at least the latter, yet all are hearts by dint of having the function of pumping blood. Adder circuits in a present-day computer are made up of silicon microcircuits, whereas those of a previous generation were made up of vacuum tubes. But if this is so, then functional kinds are not type-identical with the things that realize them in particular objects or organisms. Being made like the adder circuit in my Mac may be a sufficient condition for being an adder circuit, but it is not a necessary condition. And with the rising popularity of a functionalist interpretation of psychological kinds in the 1970s, type-identity began to wane in popularity as an account of psycho-physical relations.
Because type-identity is sometimes called "reductionism", functionalism is often presented as an alternative to reductionism. Yet this is potentially misleading. On the one hand, analytic functionalists do view their analysis as a semantic reduction of mentalistic terms to a functional (though not a structural or physical) vocabulary. On the other hand, many functionalists assume that an analysis of the realizing system will provide a micro-explanation of the functional properties of the system. (Indeed, philosophers like Lewis approach psychological kinds by way of a functional analysis that then receives a micro-explanation.) When functionalism is opposed to reductionism, the real point of difference is with a metaphysical notion of "reduction" involving type-identity. The proponent of reduction-as-type-identity holds that the relation between the kind-terms in two domains of discourse is one-to-one; the functionalist holds that it is one-to-many -- or, as it is commonly expressed, that functional kinds are multiply realizable.
Here, the perceived strength of the functionalists' argument may depend on whether one is interested in metaphysics or philosophy of science. Some metaphysicians, such as Jaegwon Kim (1993 and essay in this volume), suggest that mental and (other) functional kinds may be reducible (type-identical) to a disjunction of the physical/structural kinds of the various physical systems that can realize them. Similarly, some philosophers have suggested that the various realizers of a functional property do provide type identities, but only local ones, relative to a particular type of system or organism. That is, pain may be type-identical with C-fiber firings in humans, with green goo flowing in Martians, and with a certain circuit state in androids. Philosophers more directly engaged with philosophy of science, or with the sciences themselves, tend to see this move as being out of step with how the kinds at a given level of organization are individuated.
More Recent Developments
In recent years, discussions of relations called "reduction" have increasingly drawn upon resources from outside the philosophy of mind. Several of the writers in this volume represent this trend of either exploring specific case studies in the cognitive and biological sciences, or drawing upon more general critiques of semantic reduction, micro-reduction and type-identity that have been offered in philosophy of science.
In short, the situation might be summed up as follows: in the heyday of reductionism (say, the mid-twentieth century), 'reduction' tended to mean either semantic reduction, type-identity, or a very strong sort of micro-reduction capable of showing that the properties of the reduced system are all necessary consequences of the reducing system. But all of these notions have encountered serious philosophical problems, some purely analytic, others drawn from the observation that such relations are not generally found in the sciences, even in supposed paradigm cases of reduction. (See summary in Silberstein 2002.) At the same time, there is certainly something right about reductionism. No one would deny that micro-explanation of some sort is an important and powerful explanatory strategy, nor that there is some strong relation between realized and realizing systems. And these relations, whatever they might be in detail, are often called "reductions" by the scientists. What, then, should we say? That "reductionism" is dead and that we ought to find another terminology (say, "mechanistic explanation") for the things scientists call "reductions"? Or that examination of case studies has revealed a number of genuine reductions, but also that previous generations of philosophers have misunderstood the nature of reduction? Or might it be that the standard critiques of various notions of "reduction" do not really have the force that they are commonly supposed to have?
Hands-On Philosophy of Science
The first three essays in the collection represent what I would call "hands-on philosophy of science", in which engagement with the particulars of scientific research plays a substantial role in guiding philosophical interpretation of those sciences.
Valerie Hardcastle and Rosalyn Stewart (Ch. 1) argue that research in the cognitive sciences is sometimes hampered by an assumption that the goal is to reduce mind to brain, and draw upon case studies that provide evidence that more broadly somatic states are also needed to explain conditions such as depression. Their article provides both scientists and philosophers with reasonable cautions about the dangers of too-readily assuming a neuro-reductionist strategy. Lamentably, it is the only entry in the volume from any form of the embodied-cognition camp, which has arguably offered some of the more empirically-grounded considerations of alternatives to reductive approaches. While I am not myself a practitioner of bodily approaches to cognition, I am glad that at least this one representative of that school found its way into this collection.
John Bickle (Ch. 2) and Peter Godfrey-Smith (Ch. 3) each take the view that a philosophical notion of "reduction" should principally be guided by careful study of the actual sciences of cognition, rather than by philosophers pursuing their projects in pre-decided philosophical terms. The classic reductionisms of Carnap (1929) and Nagel (1961) may be seen as object lessons here -- little if anything can be "reduced" in the ways they supposed. But the moral Godfrey-Smith and Bickle draw is not that reductionism has been refuted, but that philosophers have failed to understand what takes place in real scientific reductions. Or, to put it differently, the word 'reduction' gets used in a lot of ways by scientists and philosophers, and the most important thing to do is not to wrangle over who gets dibs on the word, but to understand the legitimate forms of explanation at work, however one might prefer to label them. With this I am at least halfway in agreement. Philosophers of cognitive science should attend carefully to real science in the form of case studies (or even participation in empirical research); part of our job there is to clarify the nature(s) of the type(s) of explanation at work in different strands of research. On the other hand, when the history of a word is fraught with a significant history, and in this case a history whose reach has extended outside of academia into the popular press, there are also rhetorical considerations to be taken into account that go beyond mere wrangling over words. In particular, the word 'reduction' has a long history of association with views that have been seen as threatening to our humanistic self-image as beings with important traits such as free will, consciousness, and intrinsic worth and dignity. To the extent that there is a large audience, both within the academy and outside it, who are likely to hear claims for something called "reductionism" against this background, my own view is that it is more in accordance with my duties as a public intellectual to find alternative ways to label the forms of explanation I find doing important work in the sciences. Apart from that rhetorical choice, I find Godfrey-Smith's emphasis on mechanisms and models quite agreeable and right-headed.
Bickle's views present in some ways a more radical challenge. His account of what ought to be counted as a "reduction" emphasizes the role of causal interventions in low-level mechanisms and tracking the effects of these across levels. Bickle's characteristically meticulous attention to scientific detail may make for hard reading for the reader who is not literate in the appropriate sciences. But his explanations, in which sub-cellular activities play a crucial role, are striking in their contrast to prevailing assumptions that the "neural correlates" for mental states would generally be something on the order of anatomical areas that "light up" in an fMRI scan. Philosophers interested in things called "reduction" have often assumed that mental phenomena could be reduced to sub-cellular (and ultimately physical) phenomena by way of several intermediate reductions across intermediate levels of complexity. Bickle suggests that often we can dispense with all that, and reduce psychological phenomena directly to low-level neural (or perhaps even biochemical) phenomena.
Reductive Explanation and Reductive Metaphysics?
While Bickle (2003) has decided to abandon traditional metaphysical projects altogether, the majority of philosophers interested in reductionism are probably still interested in metaphysical issues like supervenience, and in how they relate to whatever notions of "reduction" seem most promising in the sciences. The remainder of the essays in the volume are devoted either to exclusively metaphysical issues, or to the relations between metaphysics and reductive forms of explanation. (It would have been very interesting to see more discussion of whether more recent formulations of "reductionistic" claims like those offered by Bickle and Godfrey-Smith have the same sorts of necessitarian metaphysical implications as older notions. But this is not so much a fault of the volume as a symptom of the fact that the philosophies of science and of mind seem at risk of dividing into camps that are interested in metaphysical issues and camps interested in hands-on case studies.)
Jaegwon Kim (Ch. 5) argues that only functional reductions can provide both metaphysical reduction and reductive explanation. Reductions by way of identity do secure metaphysical reduction but not reductive explanation, and reductions involving bridge laws do neither. Peter Lipton (Ch. 6) agrees that there can be reductive explanations without type-identity.
Ceteris Paribus Laws, Disjunctive Properties, and the Special Sciences
The Functionalist doctrine that mentalistic kinds are multiply realizable has spawned a number of debates within philosophy of psychology, debates which also have wider implications for the relation of the special sciences to fundamental physics. If there are laws within a special science -- say, psychology -- and its kinds are multiply realizable, it is not only the kinds of the special sciences, but also their laws that are, in some sense, irreducible. There is not a one-to-one correspondence between psychological laws and the physical laws governing their underlying mechanisms, because different sets of physical laws will be at work in the different types of realizing systems. And by the same token, the psychological law cannot be re-constructed from the vocabulary used in describing any of its realizing systems. Even micro-reduction might seem compromised, insofar as multiple realization entails that there is not a single micro-reduction for a psychological law.
Reductionists, however, have suggested two (alternative and incompatible) solutions to this problem. The first is to treat the disjunction of the realizing systems as collectively providing a reduction base for the laws and kinds of the special sciences. The second is to hold that there is not a single reduction for the multiply-realizable kinds, but there are nonetheless more "local" reductions to be had for each individual type of realizing system. (A third possibility, of course, is to insist that the absence of a single, ontologically-tidy reduction base implies that the special sciences are ontologically suspect.)
Historically, this problem has often been linked with other issues about laws in the special sciences: particularly, with the claim that the special sciences have only ceteris paribus laws while fundamental physics (or perhaps all of physics and chemistry) can lay claim to strict and universal laws. Indeed, multiple realization is often cited as the explanation both for the nomicity of special-science laws and for their exceptions. However, there has been a long-standing and lively debate about the status of the special sciences and their laws, concerning whether ceteris paribus laws are good enough to justify the honorific "science", and whether the special sciences are "autonomous" or require further grounding in fundamental physics in order for their laws to be seen as legitimate or warranted.
Peter Lipton (Ch. 6) re-examines questions about the relation between ceteris paribus macro laws and the strict laws in physics thought to underlie them. He argues that ceteris paribus laws can have explanatory force regardless of whether they are reducible to strict lower-level laws, echoing a theme going back to Fodor (1974), and that macro laws sometimes are better at capturing the causes correctly. More important, to my mind, is his recognition that "fundamental" laws are not truly exceptionless either. I tend to view this as bringing into question the whole received problematic about "strict" and "ceteris paribus" laws as based in a confusion. (Compare Cartwright 1983, Horst forthcoming.) But Lipton's focus is more on the relationship between macro laws and micro laws, and particularly with the status of the former.
David Papineau (Ch. 7) argues that physicalism (understood as the view that the universe is causally closed under physics) does not entail microphysicalism (the view that the universe is causally closed under the physics of the most basic units of matter). Put differently, one can embrace a physicalism that admits irreducible broad laws, and even properties of complex systems that do not supervene upon the intrinsic properties of their microphysical parts. Papineau seems most concerned with problems about classical events supervening upon quantum events; however, this article provides useful considerations for anyone interested in supporting a non-reductive physicalism or an emergentism consistent with physicalism. Nonetheless, non-physicalists may be left seeing it as supplying only a proof of the consistency of physicalism with non-reductionism, and wondering what reasons are left to prefer physicalism once the reductionist ladder has been kicked away.
Barry Loewer (Ch. 8) also takes up the question of ceteris paribus laws in the special sciences. Unlike Papineau, Loewer embraces microphysicalism, and concludes that, if there are metaphysically independent laws for the special sciences, these overdetermine their effects. The second contribution of his paper is a suggestion about how non-fundamental laws in the special sciences might get their lawlike character: namely, from fundamental dynamics combined with constraints on the initial conditions of the universe. Such an explanation has long been offered in the case of the temporally asymmetric nature of entropy, but this is the first time I have seen it offered as a more general thesis about emergent or resultant properties, and I regard it as an important proposal, as it extends an analysis that proved useful in one area in a way that should be possible to test. Working it out in detail for all of the particular laws in the biological and social sciences would, of course, require a much longer treatment, and this reader is somewhat skeptical that all would yield to this analysis.
Louise Antony (Ch. 9) addresses issues raised by Jaegwon Kim concerning the suitability of disjunctive properties consisting of the various realizers of higher-level kinds to count as nomic. She stresses the importance of distinguishing disjunctive predicates from the properties they express. While disjunctive predicates are not projectable, if they are the class of realizers of a higher-order predicate, they are necessarily co-extensive with that higher-order predicate, and so pick out the same properties. Hence, if the higher-level predicate picks out a nomic property, the disjunction of lower-level predicates must do so as well.
Causal Exclusion
Another familiar problem in philosophy of mind is that of causal exclusion. If mental events are token-identical with physical events, then mental and physical descriptions pick out numerically identical causes. Semantic reduction, type-identity, and micro-reduction all imply token physicalism, and so they can all avail themselves of this principle. But if one rejects these forms of reductionism, and holds that mental properties are distinct from physical properties, a puzzle arises. An event with a mental cause -- say, an intentional action -- also presumably has physical causes. Indeed, if one embraces the principle that physics is causally closed (i.e., that every physical effect has an adequate physical cause), there seems to be no work left for the mental cause to do. This puzzling result can be made even more problematic if one endorses the causal exclusion principle: namely, that there cannot be more than one sufficient cause for an effect. There are several possible solutions to the puzzle: (1) treat mental events as epiphenomenal (i.e., as having no causal powers, at least on the physical world), (2) re-affirm some type of psycho-physical reduction, (3) deny causal closure, or (4) deny the exclusion principle.
Peter Menzies (Ch. 11) argues that non-reductive physicalists need not be troubled by the causal exclusion problem if that is interpreted according to a difference-making account of causation. When a mental property is the difference-maker for a behavioral property, a physical property may be causally sufficient to produce the behavioral property as well, yet fail to be a difference-maker for it.
James Woodward (Ch. 12) urges that philosophers have argued for the causal inertness of the mental on the basis of a mistaken analysis of causation (that a cause is simply anything nomologically sufficient for its effect) combined with the D-N analysis of explanation. Woodward suggests that we replace these with an interventionist account of causation and causal explanation. Significantly, an interventionist understanding of causation allows for macroscopic causal explanations, particularly in such cases as those in which manipulation of variables of multiply-realizable mental states can be used to predict commonalities of outcome. Moreover, on the interventionist analysis, we should reject the causal exclusion principle, as there can be multiple types of interventions that reliably produce characteristic changes in outcome.
Daniel Stoljar (Ch. 13) argues that the causal exclusion principle is more persuasive as an argument against dualism than against non-reductive physicalism. The basis of the difference is that, in the case of dualism, the irreducible properties are (putatively) strongly modally distinct, whereas in the case of non-reductive physicalism, they are only numerically or weakly modally distinct, and in the case of numerical and weakly-modal distinctness, there are clear counter-examples to the exclusion principle, such as cases where the causal sufficiency of a determinate property does not exclude the causal relevance of its determinable property. Karen Bennett (Ch. 14) argues to much the same conclusion: that only physicalists can escape the exclusion principle, and that they can do so because they mean something weaker than what dualists mean in claiming that mental properties are "distinct" from physical properties.
These entries represent sophisticated attempts to solve the causal exclusion problem, and draw upon contemporary resources in philosophy of science to shed light on problems in metaphysics of mind. However, I have never gotten particularly excited about this particular problem, as I find little reason to endorse two of the assumptions of the tetralemma from which it arises. On the one hand, where do we get this principle that an event cannot have two sufficient causes? It strikes me as a kind if metaphysical apriorism that is in tension with what one finds in the sciences themselves. (In biology and neuroscience, after all, causal redundancy is seen as a virtue.) On the other hand, where do we get the principle of causal closure? It is not entailed by any first-order scientific theory I am aware of. Rather, it seems to be either an independent philosophical commitment or else a methodological maxim ("treat an experimental situation as though it were a closed system", or perhaps "look for sufficient physical causes") masquerading as an empirical discovery.
Comments
Given the continuing influence of notions of "reduction" in philosophy of mind, this book provides a welcome compilation of the current state of debates about both explanation and metaphysics. It should prove a useful textbook for graduate and advanced undergraduate courses, as well as providing professionals with some contemporary touchstones. It is probably not suitable as a stand-alone introduction to debates about reduction, as most of the articles are responding to a number of decades-old debates within philosophy of mind and philosophy of science. But it is not clear that adding a half-dozen classic articles would have improved the book, as the common points of reference are part of the "received canon" and readily available in any of a number of standard textbooks.
The editors are to be commended for including articles representing what I have called "hands-on" philosophy of science along with the more metaphysical articles. If there is a way in which the volume leaves me disappointed, it is the fact that the book does not bring these two strands of contemporary philosophy of science and mind into closer contact. The articles by Bickle and Godfrey-Smith, for example, reflect the attitude that I find prominent among philosophers of science -- that "classic" forms of reduction of the sort found from Carnap to Nagel are dead. One is left wanting to know whether the weaker forms of "reduction" they explore can support the same sorts of metaphysical conclusions that were associated with older types of reduction.
Conversely, it would be interesting to re-assess the main lines of metaphysical dispute, such as multiple realization, causal exclusion, and the status of the special sciences, in light of the results of the kinds of analysis of actual explanation in the special sciences offered by Bickle and Godfrey-Smith. Some new-school philosophers of science (including Bickle in his 2003 book) take the view that we should simply abandon the questions of traditional analytic metaphysics in order to devote our attention to the sciences themselves. I, for one, tend to side with the new school's rejection of many of the canons of Empiricist philosophy of science that seem to have found a last stronghold in philosophy of mind, but am not convinced that this means that we need abandon metaphysics entirely. We are in need of a discussion of the implications of contemporary philosophy of science for the metaphysics of mind. Perhaps this volume will help to provide the pieces from which such a discussion can proceed.
References
Bickle, John. 1998. Psychoneural Reduction: The New Wave. Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
---. 2003. Philosophy and Neuroscience: A Ruthlessly Reductive Account. Kluwer.
Carnap, Rudolf. 1929. Der Logische Aufbau der Welt. Leipzig: Felix Meiner Verlag.
Cartwright, Nancy. 1983. How the Laws of Physics Lie. Oxford University Press.
Fodor, Jerry. 1974. Special Sciences (or: the distunity of science as a working hypothesis). Synthese 28:97-115.
Horst, Steven. 2007. Beyond Reduction: Philosophy of Mind and Post-Reductionist Philosophy of Science. New York: Oxford University Press.
---. Forthcoming. Laws, Mind and Freedom.
Kim, Jaegwon. 1993. Supervenience and Mind: Selected Philosophical Essays. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
Levine, Joseph. 1983. Materialism and Qualia: The Explanatory Gap. Pacific Philosophical Quarterly 64:354-61.
Nagel, Ernest. 1961. The Structure of Science. New York: Harcourt, Brace and World.
Oppenheim, Paul, and Hilary Putnam. 1958. Unity of Science as a Working Hypothesis. In Concepts, Theories, and the Mind-Body Problem, edited by H. Feigl, M. Scriven and G. Maxwell. Minneapolis: University of Minnesota Press.
Silberstein, Michael. 2002. Reduction, Emergence and Explanation. In The Blackwell Guide to the Philosophy of Science, edited by P. Machamer and M. Silberstein. Malden, MA and Oxford: Blackwell.
Stich, Stephen P., and Stephen Laurence. 1994. Intentionality and Naturalism. In Midwest Studies in Philosophy, edited by P. A. French, T. E. Uehling, Jr. and H. K. Wettstein. Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press.