Confucianism and American Philosophy

This book seeks to further develop dialogue between the American pragmatist and transcendentalist traditions, and classical Confucian thought. Scholars have previously noted certain parallels and commonalities, but the aim here is to "expand the scope of this area of comparative philosophy beyond the typically engaged duo of Confucius and Dewey" (p. 129). As a work in comparative philosophy, the book also seeks to contribute to the ongoing debate about the status of non-Western intellectual traditions within the discipline of philosophy. Much has been written recently on this topic,[1] and this work makes its contribution by familiarizing those working in American philosophy with classical Confucian thought, and vice versa.

The book has five main chapters, each discussing a prominent figure in classic American philosophy and his historical or conceptual connections with the Confucian tradition. The Confucian tradition is here mainly understood as the texts Analects of Confucius, Mencius and Xunzi. The Americans are Emerson, Thoreau, Peirce, James and Royce. Each chapter addresses a single philosophical question discussed by an American thinker. In order, starting with Emerson, these are, "With whom should we be friends? When is civil disobedience justifiable? How should we attain beliefs? Are we naturally moral? How should we act if we have committed wrongdoing?" (p. 130) Foust initiates a dialogue with classical Confucian responses to these questions.

One aim of the book, relevant to the first two chapters, is to show more clearly how Confucian thought influenced Emerson's and Thoreau's respective views on friendship and civil disobedience. The final three chapters explore resonances between the American pragmatists and classical Confucian thought, although none of James, Peirce or Royce directly engaged with Confucian texts. Such a cross-cultural approach will, Foust believes, illustrate the value of doing philosophy comparatively. Considering the connections, both direct and indirect, between the two traditions engenders a better understanding of both, but it can also generate new responses to pressing and common philosophical problems (pp. 129-30).

The chapter on Emerson takes aim at the view that Confucian thought appears in the Transcendentalists' work only as literary embellishment (p. 20). Drawing on his own archival research, Foust shows that the influence of Chinese thought is greater than previously acknowledged. Emerson's journals and recorded speeches, for example, feature "dozens" of sentences from Confucius (p. 19).

The chapter's central argument claims agreement between Emerson and the Analects about the nature of friendship. Despite the hierarchical nature of many roles and relationships outlined in the Analects, and the implications of this for friendship, the text nevertheless values reciprocity: "friends do develop mutual respect and bonds in spite of hierarchies." (p. 28) Such friendship ideally entails mutual moral development; not only does one befriend more refined characters to learn from them, the sociality of friendship is also important for the more cultivated party, as a site to exercise and maintain excellence. Foust identifies a similar account of friendship in Emerson's "Friendship," such that friendship is rooted in "mutual moral cultivation" (p. 37).

Chapter two focuses on Thoreau's "Civil Disobedience." Here, "civil" does not mean "non-violent" or "orderly"; it refers to "civil law," the breaking of which when conscience dictates is civil disobedience. Foust maintains, against the view that Thoreau made little use of Confucian ideas, that "Thoreau engages much more with Confucianism in 'Civil Disobedience' than immediately meets the eye." (p. 44) Consequently, and in spite of the essay's first line -- "That government is best which governs the least" (cited on p. 46) -- he argues that Thoreau was not inclined towards anarchism, but was seeking improvement in defective government. Thoreau is with Confucius on this point, Foust claims, since the Analects also sought the reform of rulers' conduct. Furthermore, it also downplayed the importance of legal statues or civil law. Analects 2.3 famously declares that "coercive regulations" and "punishments" are not the way to order the people and that, if guided by "virtue" and "ritual," they will rectify themselves. Here the claim is not that the source of Thoreau's view was the Analects, but that there is alignment between the two regarding the permissibility of civil disobedience. A difference exists between the traditions, however. Unlike Thoreau, the Confucian account restricts resistance to ministers and those directly under the rulers: "Confucius and Mencius would not authorize civil disobedience on the part of the citizenry" (p. 58).

The third chapter explores connections between Charles Sanders Peirce's epistemology and the Confucian conception of knowledge. It begins from a debate about Confucian thought: is it authoritarian or authoritative? Authoritarian here refers to "strict obedience to authority" (p. 61), while authoritative refers to "reliability" (p. 61) and influence in the establishment of social standards and models. Simply put, is the Confucius of the Analects a conservative reactionary, or a more progressive figure?

To answer this, Foust analyzes the Confucian approach to knowledge using the four methods for arriving at belief laid out in Peirce's classic article "The Fixation of Belief" -- tenacity, authority, the a priori method, and scientific inquiry. Confucian social ethics and epistemology might appear most closely aligned with Peirce's "method of authority," whereby elites fix foundational truths. Foust argues, however, that the Analects rejects such authoritarianism. Moving through Peirce's four methods, Foust argues that Confucius rejected the first three and endorsed the fourth method, inquiry. This is based on similarities between Peirce's account of how doubt drives the formation of belief -- and is most securely assuaged by scientific inquiry -- and the Confucian emphasis on learning (xue), which Foust argues should be understood as a disposition to inquire. The quasi-autobiographical passage 2.4 in the Analects is central to this argument:

The Master said, "At fifteen, I set my mind upon learning (xue); at thirty, I took my place in society; at forty, I became free of doubts; at fifty, I understood Heaven's Mandate (tianming 天命); at sixty, my ear was attuned; and at seventy, I could follow my heart's desires without overstepping the bounds of propriety." (quoted on p. 63)

This passage presents a description of "epistemological development" (p. 64), such that after a lifetime of Confucian-style learning, Confucius' conduct at age 70 is free from doubt. "Patience, persistence and gradual self-cultivation" (p. 81) secure for the individual an authoritativeness that is not authoritarian.

Chapter four focuses on human nature and compares William James with the classical Confucians Mencius and Xunzi on whether human nature is good or bad. Crudely put, Mencius claimed that human nature is good, or disposed towards becoming good, while Xunzi claimed that human nature is bad, disordered, or chaotic, and in need of social conditioning. Foust uses James' comments on human nature to clarify the two Confucians' positions.

Foust draws on James' distinction in The Varieties of Religious Experience between the "healthy minded" personality, which tends to see the good in things, and the "sick-souled" personality, which sees evil as an inevitable part of life (p. 93). The obvious alignment is to read Mencius as a "healthy minded" type and Xunzi as "sick-souled"; yet Foust cautions against this simplistic categorization. He argues that both thinkers are broadly positive about the prospects for human nature, with their differences better expressed by another of James's distinctions, that between involuntary and voluntary (or "systematic") modes of healthy-mindedness (p. 94). The former describes one who can immediately enjoy experience, focusing on the positive, while the latter mode requires conscious effort and conditioning to expel evil from thought and conduct. Mencius' view of human nature corresponds to involuntary healthy-mindedness, Xunzi's to the voluntary form. More importantly, this interpretation distances Xunzi from the stark claim that human nature is bad or evil, and instead reads Xunzi as emphasizing that goodness must be diligently and consciously cultivated. Both Mencius and Xunzi are thus optimistic about human dispositions and inner life, but differ in their views about the ease with which this is accomplished.

Foust also uses the Mencius and the Xunzi to generate a plausible and coherent reading of James's inconsistent comments on human nature. Briefly stated, he argues that James's views align more closely with Xunzi than Mencius (pp. 95-99). James's fascination with the martial virtues -- "For James, the instinct of pugnacity is an intractable part of the human condition" (p.97) -- leads him to call for a kind of non-military civil service in "The Moral Equivalent of War." This channeling of human courage and aggression towards more peaceful aims mirrors Xunzi's demand that ritual should reform inner desire.

The fifth chapter focuses on shame and the moral psychology of wrongdoing. One aim here is to challenge the view that virtues closely associated with Christianity, such as forgiveness and repentance, have no counterparts in Confucian thought. This involves a comparative study of Josiah Royce and the classical Confucians on shame and atonement. Shame is here defined as "a negative feeling caused by awareness of something dishonorable done by oneself or another" (p. 103), while atonement involves "some sort of correction or repair in the wake of incorrect or injurious action." (p. 104)

Those familiar with Royce's writings on guilt will be aware of their theological orientation, Christian vocabulary, and interest in sin. Some might question whether such a framework is suitable for comparison with the Confucian tradition, which is often regarded as developing without the theological commitments of the Abrahamic traditions. Foust argues, however, that Royce's ideas can be "stripped of their Christian clothing and found to be more or less congruent with concepts from Confucian philosophy." (p. 116) Foust cites several Analects passages in which the Confucian sages apparently value atonement for wrongdoing, such as 1.18 and 19.21. This allows for a common gloss on the Confucian sages to be challenged -- that they are moral exemplars whose refinement and cultivation allow them to consistently arrive at the right actions.

Shame is, clearly, an important part of Confucian discourse; but if atonement is also an important element, as Foust claims, then a richer Confucian psychology emerges. It is one in which the idealized Confucian person is fallible, yet also inclined to recognize and make up for wrongdoing. This raises the possibility, in Royce's words, of a world (and the repaired relationships created through atonement) that might be "better than it would have been had all else remained the same." (p. 115) Making mistakes and making up for them might be preferable to lofty perfection.

As a whole, this book impresses by opening up new frontiers of philosophical exchange. The scholarship in the American tradition is painstakingly done, and will be of particular benefit to those who seek to systematically develop insights presented only in embryonic form in the classical Chinese texts. Using Pierce's work to develop classical Confucian epistemology, for example, is an approach worthy of more extended treatment than a single chapter permits. It is provocative (the early Confucians were no scientists) yet suggestive (defenders of a modernized Confucianism often claim pragmatic approaches to action and inquiry in the Analects).

At the same time, it is worth noting some of the book's limitations, both intentional and otherwise. First, one wonders why only the Analects, Mencius and Xunzi are included in the comparison. Confucian texts such as the Book of Ritual (Liji) and the Book of Songs -- questions of authorship and dating aside - are also important in articulating classical Confucian views of human nature, knowledge and morality, and would be germane to any comparative study. Such omissions are understandable, however, since the three texts covered are the most widely translated classical Confucian texts, and limiting a comparative study to them makes the project manageable. But this advantage can become a limitation if comparisons are isolated from the full complexity of Confucian conceptual resources. Since the author draws on texts as temporally and intellectually diverse as the Mencius and the Xunzi, why not these other texts?

The narrow coverage of Confucian texts is noteworthy, because it sometimes diminishes the persuasiveness of the comparative claims. For example, certain arguments rely on particular interpretations of Analects' passages (see below). Granted, such readings are thoughtfully corroborated with other Analects passages. Given, however, that the Analects' passages are terse, occasionally gnomic and subject to conflicting interpretations (a case of caveat emptor, as one sinologist put it),[2] skeptical readers could also selectively emphasize passages that reinforce their own counter-reading. Drawing on a richer textual nexus would have shored up some of the author's interpretations.

Generally, the chapters are rewarding and deserving of close attention, particularly those on friendship, epistemology and human nature. But the chapter on civil disobedience and the Analects illustrates the concern just noted. Analects passage 1.2 -- those who are filial at home will be disinclined to disobey superiors and rebel -- is claimed as supporting the author's interpretation. It allegedly disapproves of the persistent inclination to be rebellious but not more considered rebellion, and thus presents no obstacle to Thoreau's principled civil disobedience. But this seems too quick; it underplays the broader value system of which 1.2 is representative. The point is not that nothing comparable to civil disobedience can be found in the Analects, but rather whether any alleged similarity is illuminating.

Inclusion of a wider range of Confucian texts would introduce useful questions about what analogous Confucian concepts and values are pertinent here, and whether approaching the Analects through the lenses of civil disobedience obscures Confucian approaches to the reform of government, which might provide a philosophically interesting alternative to Thoreau's view. For example, Confucian remonstrance (jian) seems central to Confucian thinking about improving government, but is strangely absent from discussions; appearing sparingly in the Analects (five times), a fuller account of it could be drawn from the Liji (Book of Rituals) and also the Xunzi.

Arguably, remonstrance does cohere with the first sense of "civil" disobedience noted by the author, that of non-violent orderly resistance, but it's less clear with regard to the second -- self-conscious and thoughtful breaking of the law -- since the limits of remonstrance are vague. More importantly, remonstrance (and the vaunting of filial conduct) suggests a method for improving government quite different from defying the law: the reforming of ruler's and minister's personal character and conduct, often through personal interaction and interventions. Thus, drawing on a richer set of Confucian texts and conceptual resources might have enriched the already engaging discussion by introducing contrast and difference -- which is sometimes philosophically more interesting than broad similarity.

Still, as noted in the conclusion, Foust seeks to broaden the discussion rather than provide a final and definitive study, introducing scholars to intellectual traditions outside their regular remit; accordingly, the limited focus on Confucian texts is appropriate for this purpose.

Overall, this book can serve as a valuable resource for those working in either Confucianism or pragmatism, as it is the first text in this area to adopt such a wide-ranging and systematic problem-based approach to the two traditions. The work feels well-suited to the historical moment and the state of field: it serves as a bridging text, establishing the foundations for wider debate as the field of comparative philosophical studies evolves.