Essays on Anscombe's Intention

This publication marks a new stage in the reception of Anscombe's thought. In the decades following the publication of Intention, readers saw Anscombe's philosophy of action largely through a Davidsonian lens. Davidson's selective reconstruction was more accessible and less Wittgensteinian than the original. It also encouraged the hope of absorbing Anscombe's insights within a comfortable causalism about the mental. This hope could be sustained as long as relatively few philosophers made a serious study of Anscombe's book.

As the present volume shows, those days are over. We now have a critical mass of authors with the scholarly skill and the philosophical acumen to put us in direct contact with Intention. This is a book about what we have missed.

The editors go out of their way to facilitate the introduction. In addition to the usual index, they include a detailed index to Anscombe's Intention, which works as a kind of concordance between the commentaries and the source. And in addition to a fine introduction, Frederick Stoutland provides a brief summary of the primary source. Against all odds, he manages to tell the story of Intention in a mere ten pages, so that each of the contributors picks up where some part of the summary leaves off.

What have we hitherto missed in Intention? One answer might be that we have underestimated the degree to which Anscombe departs from the orthodox view of intention as a mental state that serves as an efficient cause of behavior. One could put this by saying she denies that intention is a state, holding instead that intention belongs, together with action itself, in the category of process. To intend to act is already to be in the process of doing the action. Intending to act is thus not something that could be the efficient cause of that whole process. Michael Thompson develops this view in his book Life and Action, but does not there argue that it is Anscombe's view.

In their paper, "Anscombe on Expression of Intention: An Exegesis," Richard Moran and Martin Stone offer a reading on which Anscombe does hold a process view of intending to act. To grasp her view, they argue, one must appreciate her appeal to the idea of an expression of intention.

On the orthodox reading, Anscombe distinguishes expressions of intention, such as "I am going to take a walk," from two related topics, namely intentional action and the intention with which an action is done. On this reading it is hard to see how the notion of an expression of intention could reveal the three topics as falling under a single concept of intention. The temptation is to see her as reserving expression of intention, strangely, for cases of intending to do something in the future -- something one may not even have begun to do. Thus transformed, Anscombe'sview now needs some account of how these purely future-directed intentions are connected to the topics of intentional action and acting "in order to." One might analyze the latter topics in terms of causation by states of intending. Or, in a behaviorist mood, one might analyze intending for the future in terms of characteristically intentional behavior.

Moran and Stone argue that Anscombe rejects all such "connectivist" strategies in favor of an "immediate elucidation" that "exhibits the divisions of intention as inflections of a single form" (37). They note that Anscombe uses "expression of intention" in two ways. There is a special use that is interchangeable with "expression of intention for the future." But there is also a general use that refers to the genus comprising answers to the question "Why?" Understood in this general way, an expression of intention need not be for the future. For instance, if I ask you what you are doing and you say, "I'm buying some shoes," this counts as an expression of intention in the general sense. But it is an expression of intention in action, not an expression of intention for the future.

Moran and Stone conclude that the general use covers all three of Anscombe's divisions of intention. This encourages them to see Anscombe as using the idea of an expression of intention to elucidate the concept of intention. What unifies the three divisions, on this reading, is that in each case there is some question "Why?" to which answer could be given in an expression of intention. "An intention is whatever can be given to another in an expression suited to play this role," that is, the role of explaining what is "going on" by fitting it into a "whole-in-progress" (55).

One question is whether the general use Moran and Stone have identified really covers all three of Anscombe' divisions. It covers cases where there is something going on, of which someone could ask "Why?" But as Anscombe says, a man can form an intention which he then does nothing to carry out. In that case there appears to be nothing going on for the expression of intention to explain. And there never will be, if the man never does anything to carry out his intention. He can express his intention, perhaps saying, "After dinner I'm going to buy some shoes." But this does not explain anything that is going on. How then is the case of pure intending still an instance of the same form as the cases of intentional action and acting with a further intention?

One reply would be to say that were the man to do something to carry out the intention, his expression of intention would explain that. So there need not be anything going on, so long as the expression of intention is suited to explain what would have gone on, if the agent had done anything to carry out the intention. But now it looks as if there are two things, the intention and its execution. And this leaves us to wonder why we should think all intention belongs to the form of whole-in-progress. The temptation will be to place the intention itself in the category of state rather than process. The appeal to expressions of intention was supposed to help us resist that temptation, but it is not clear how it would. Why not think of expressions of intention for the future as expressing a state?

Another strategy would be to read Anscombe as denying that one can intend to buy some shoes without already being in the process of doing so. One might then take her to hold that anyone in the process of doing something must have been doing it for some time, however briefly. And then, perhaps, she would say it must be possible to divide what the man has so far done into parts or phases, of which we could ask "Why?" The expression of intention, "I'm going to buy some shoes," would answer that question. This would preserve the process view of intention, but at some expense in textual support. As Moran and Stone point out, what Anscombe says is that an intentional action is one "subject to the question 'Why?'" She does not say that wherever there is intention there is an answer to a why question. Rather, she says that wherever there is intention the question "Why?" has application.

But the authors argue that their "reversal" of her better-known formula is no departure from Anscombe's view. That we can put her view in terms of answers to the question "Why?" is implicit, they say, in her picture of action as a nested chain. If I am buying shoes intentionally, then one can ask me why I'm buying shoes. But equally, there will be other things I am doing as parts or phases of this buying, and "I'm buying shoes" will answer the "Why?" question about those other things. In support of this reading they cite the following passage, inserting their notes in italics:

To a certain extent the three divisions of the subject made in §1 are simply equivalent. That is to say, where the answers 'I am going to fetch my camera' [expression of intention for the future], 'I am fetching my camera' [intentional act] and 'in order to fetch the camera' [further intention in acting] are interchangeable as answers to the question 'Why?' (57)

Moran and Stone omit the end of the last sentence, which reads "asked when I go upstairs." The omission may matter. For on one plausible reading, Anscombe's point is that the three divisions are equivalent for cases in which the agent does something to carry out the intention. Going upstairs would be an example. This leaves it open whether the three divisions are equivalent for the case where the agent does nothing to carry out the intention. In particular, it leaves it open that "After dinner I'm going to buy some shoes" reveals the question "Why are you going to buy shoes?" to have application, but does not answer any "Why?" question at all. If that is Anscombe's view, then it is once again puzzling how her appeal to expressions of intention would help her unseat the sort of "connectivist" view on which intentions fall in the category of state rather than process.

Faced with these difficulties, one might turn to a different way of finding unity in the three divisions of the subject. Anscombe says we have a special kind of knowledge -- practical knowledge -- of our intentional actions. Perhaps she takes this kind of knowledge to characterize all three of the divisions of the subject. On this reading, the one who says "After dinner I'm going to buy some shoes" has practical knowledge of what he is going to do. We could take Anscombe's appeal to the question "Why?" as a preliminary device for marking out the subject, and look to the notion of practical knowledge for her real account.

Four of the ten papers are about practical knowledge. A fifth, John McDowell's "Anscombe on Bodily Self-Knowledge," concerns the related topic of knowledge without observation. Anscombe says one can know the position of one's limbs without observation. In this respect, bodily self-knowledge is like the special sort of knowledge one has of what one is intentionally doing. But what does she mean by "known without observation?" One thing she says about bodily self-knowledge is that it does not rest on inference. But ordinary perceptual knowledge, say of the position of your cursor on the screen, is also non-inferential, and that knowledge is observational. So how is bodily self-knowledge different? On McDowell's reconstruction, Anscombe would distinguish bodily self-knowledge from perceptual knowledge on the ground that perceptual knowledge comes by way of impressions of secondary qualities and their arrangement. She would argue that in bodily self-knowledge we find no such experience of secondary qualities. McDowell goes on to suggest that bodily self-knowledge is neither practical nor receptive. It is not practical, because it is not the cause of what it understands. And it is not receptive, because it is knowledge of oneself as self, rather than as other. As ever, McDowell sees preconceptions where others see problems, and expands our sense of the theoretical possibilities.

As if to build on McDowell's discussion, Adrian Haddock ("The Knowledge That a Man Has of His Intentional Actions") asks what distinguishes practical knowledge from other cases of knowledge without observation. Practical knowledge is not gotten through the operation of any perceptual faculty, but then neither is bodily self-knowledge. What marks off practical knowledge within the class of things known without observation? Haddock's answer is that the knowledge one has of one's intentional actions is a "simple consequence of the actuality of its objects" (162). For me to know without observation how my leg is positioned, more is required than just that my leg be positioned that way. I have to be able to tell. But for me to know without observation what I am doing intentionally, nothing more is required than that I be doing it intentionally. No capacity to know is required over and above the actuality of the thing known. Haddock provides real help with some of the more vexing aspects of Intention, among them Anscombe's analogy with commands, her rather sudden introduction of the topic of practical reasoning, and her apparent suggestion that, although practical knowledge is knowledge of what happens, the knowledge would be the same even if the intended action did not happen.

But does the actuality of intentional action really suffice for knowing what one is doing? Some have argued that it does not. Davidson, for instance, suggested that one might intentionally make ten copies, using carbon paper, even if one didn't know one was making ten copies.[1] For many, including Michael Bratman and Sarah Paul,[2] such cases show that Anscombe's attempt to understand intention in terms of practical knowledge is misguided. But others, among them David Velleman and Kieran Setiya, think that though the connection between intentional action and knowledge is not as tight as Anscombe suggests, her basic insight survives the counterexamples. The latter authors treat intention as a species of belief, whereas the former treat it as a non-cognitive state.

In his "Knowledge of Intention," Setiya argues that cognitivists about intention are uniquely able to explain something that even non-cognitivists must grant. It must be agreed on all hands, he says, that Self-blindness is impossible. More specifically, anyone with the capacity to act for reasons and to ascribe intentions to others has the capacity for groundless knowledge of her own intentions. If the capacity to act for reasons is a capacity for knowledge of what one is doing, Setiya says, then we can explain the capacity for knowledge of one's own intentions as a redeployment or "repurposing" of that very capacity. The model for this sort of redeployment is Evans's discussion of transparency in belief. If I have the capacity to follow rules of inference, then I can use that same capacity to follow a rule of transparency that licenses believing 'I believe that p on the basis of my belief that p.' Similarly, as Evans notes, the capacity for perceptual knowledge can be redeployed to gain knowledge of how things seem. And finally, the capacity for groundless knowledge of what one is doing can be redeployed to gain groundless knowledge of what one intends. The cognitivist holds that anyone who can act for reasons has a capacity for groundless knowledge of what she is doing. So the cognitivist can explain why the capacity to act for reasons entails the capacity for groundless knowledge of one's intentions. But this redeployment strategy is not available to the non-cognitivist, Setiya argues, and this leaves the non-cognitivist unable to explain why Self-blindness is impossible.

Here one might wish Setiya had said more about why the non-cognitivist is strictly out of options. Perhaps the redeployment strategy is out. But there might be other responses. The non-cognitivist might say, for instance, that in order to count as acting for a reason, one must know what one intends in doing the action. Something similar might be plausible for belief. Suppose my reason for thinking you are married is that you are wearing a gold band. It isn't clear how I could have that as my reason if I didn't know what I thought about whether you are wearing a gold band. Likewise, suppose my reason for opening the door is that I'm throwing the cat out. Could that be so if I didn't know what I intended, in opening the door? Perhaps knowledge of the intention with which one acts is just part of what it is to have something as one's reason. That would explain why the capacity to act for reasons entails the capacity for that knowledge.

Setiya's reply, in part, is to stress the outward-looking character of inference. "In its simplest form, inference is wholly world-directed, moving from premise to conclusion without self-ascription" (182). But suppose we grant that my premise is just that you are wearing a gold band, and not that I believe you are. It doesn't follow that I can make the inference without knowing what I think about whether you are wearing a gold band.[3]

As I said, Setiya starts by parting company with Anscombe over the necessity of practical knowledge for intentional action. In "Anscombe's Intention and Practical Knowledge," Michael Thompson tacks much closer to Anscombe's line. His response to Davidson's carbon-copy example is to emphasize Anscombe's focus on the progressive. He says Davidson's case is not the ordinary one:

The more ordinary case is like this: you write on the top sheet, trying to make a good impression to get through all the carbons, then look to see if your impression made it through to all of them. If it did, you stop. If it didn't, you remove the last properly impressed sheet and begin again. If necessary, you repeat. Even the man who has to go through five stages is all along, from the first feeble impression, making ten copies of the document, and he knows it, all along. The one who doesn't know it, Davidson's man, must be under some strange mafia threat: he gets one chance, no checking, and he's dead if he doesn't manage it. Well, for him, the making of the inscription is like the buying of a lottery ticket. You can say he made ten copies intentionally if you like, but it will not be an illustration of the topic of Anscombe's book, any more than lottery winning is when you bought the ticket with that aim (210).

Unlike Setiya, Thompson holds on to the idea that practical knowledge of what one is doing is necessary for intentional action. He does so, however, by limiting the topic of Anscombe's book to what he calls the more ordinary case, in which the agent checks and repeats as necessary. This is certainly an ordinary case. But is it the only one?

Here is another quite ordinary case. The instructions on the form say, "Press hard, you are making ten copies." You press hard, and thereby make ten copies. But since you are not asked to do anything more than press hard, you don't check and repeat as necessary. If the instructions said, "Make ten copies," you might have to do that, but they don't.

I think this example well illustrates the topic of Anscombe's book. But in any case it would be rash to disqualify it simply on the ground that it involves no checking and repeating. Nor is it like the case of the mafia threat. There you can't check. Here you simply don't. And finally, it is unlike a lottery. In a typical lottery case you face long odds, and you know it. In the present case there is no assumption that your chances of making ten copies are slim.

Assuming this is a case when you make ten copies intentionally, we need to consider whether you know, as you press hard, that you are making ten copies. Davidson could argue that you do not. Instructions of this sort tend to overstate the quality of the technology. The "easy-open" package often isn't. If you were asked, as you were pressing hard, whether you were making ten copies, you might have to admit that you don't know, since you haven't checked.

On the other hand, you do know why you are pressing hard. It's because you are making ten copies. So there is some pull toward saying you do know you are making ten copies. To assess the claim that intentional action requires knowledge of what you are doing, we need to understand this pull. We will not understand it, though, by focusing exclusively on cases of checking and repeating, since this is not such a case.

Of course one might question whether this is a case of making ten copies intentionally. One might try to treat the making of ten copies as a foreseen but unintended consequence, for example. But there is a significant difference. When you turn on the light knowing you will wake your partner, you are not turning on the light because you are waking your partner. When you press hard, you are pressing hard because you are making ten copies, and you know that this is why you are doing it. That makes it hard to deny, I think, that you make ten copies intentionally.

The final essay on practical knowledge, Sebastian Rödl's "Two Forms of Practical Knowledge," is an attempt to reconcile Anscombe's account of practical knowledge with Kant's. Rödl focuses on two aspects of Kant's account. One is that practical knowledge is "not knowledge of anything actual," since it is purely formal and hence lacks material content. The other is that practical knowledge is knowledge of what one ought to do as opposed to what one is doing. Anscombe, for her part, takes practical knowledge to be both knowledge of what one is actually doing and, as such, knowledge of something actual. Part of Rödl's response is to say the two philosophers are talking about different things. But more than that, he thinks they are talking about two aspects of the same thing. In particular, he argues that the capacity to know what it is good to do and the capacity to know what you are doing are two aspects of a single capacity or "power," namely the power to act through reasoning. Because he takes that to be Kant's view, and because he sees Anscombe as articulating at least a part of that view, Rödl sees Anscombeas "recovering Kant for modern philosophy."

We might ask how far this reconciliation is supposed to go. Does Anscombe agree that knowledge of what it is good to do has no material content and is thus not knowledge of something actual? Rödl doesn't say. Anscombe's discussion of desirability characterizations might suggest that she thinks knowledge of the good does have material content, and is in fact knowledge of something actual. Many would see this issue as dividing Kant and Aristotle as well.

Rödl's appeal to the idea of a power may also seem to clash with Anscombe's outlook. Jennifer Hornsby's paper, "Actions in Their Circumstances," challenges this impression. According to Hornsby, the idea that "agents have powers to affect things" lies at the heart of Anscombe's conception of action (125). Our failure to see this has obscured profound differences betweenAnscombe and Davidson. To see them as differing primarily over whether reasons are causes is to miss an underlying dispute. Indeed Hornsby thinks the authors themselves had trouble appreciating the extent of their disagreement.

Hornsby distinguishes three ways of relating action and causation. One, the agent-causation view, is to see the agent as the cause of her actions. Another, the Davidsonian view, is to assume that causation is a relation between things other than agents -- typically events or states -- and to account for action using only that conception of causation. The third, which she finds inAnscombe, is to acknowledge a kind of causation that consists in an agent's affecting something.

The agent does not cause the action, on this view. Rather, the action is the agent's "causing something or other." For instance, my scraping something is my affecting the thing in a way that amounts to its being scraped. There is just one event here, but that event is a causing in which I am the cause. Davidson, by contrast, is forced to treat the scraping as a case of one event, a bodily movement, causing another event. And when it comes to the bodily movement itself he is forced to deny that causation is any part of what makes the movement an action. "According to Davidson, . . . a person's moving her body just is her body's moving" (113). He is thus committed to the "ad hoc" view that transitive verbs like "move" and "raise" imply causation, except in the case of immediately moving one's body. Anscombe's view fares better, Hornsby argues, because it has no need for such ad hoc measures. Hornsby draws out further implications of this disagreement between Anscombe and Davidson, particularly for the individuation of action, and argues that these differences too favor Anscombe's account.

Ben Laurence, "An Anscombian Approach to Collective Action," is an extension of Anscombe's account to shared intention. If I intend to rob a bank, and you intend to rob the same bank, then there is a sense in which we share an intention, even if we are not conspiring to rob the bank. But if we do act together, there is a "thicker" sense in which we share an intention. Laurence seeks an account of this idea of acting as a group and, equivalently, of this thicker sense of shared intention. He argues that there is a special collective sense of the question "Why?" that contrasts with the sense Anscombe discusses. For instance, if I ask you why you are pushing a car, and you say, "It seemed like a good way to get some exercise," then you are answering Anscombe's question. But if you say "We're pushing it to the gas station," then you are answering the collective question. Both questions are looking for some further action of which the pushing is a part or phase, but Anscombe's asks for a further action of the agent, whereas the collective question asks for an action of a larger group to which the agent belongs. Laurence proposes that agents act as a group when the collective question "Why?" has application. His development of this idea is thorough and subtle, and he concludes with an illuminating discussion of how to avoid saying there is a group mind distinct from the minds of the individuals who do the collective action.

In "Backward-Looking Rationality and the Unity of Practical Reason," Anselm Müller challenges the widespread assumption that all practical reasoning is a movement from some end to an action calculated as a way of realizing the end. He finds a version of this assumption operating in Intention. There Anscombe distinguishes between "forward-looking reasons," which are supplied by purposes or further intentions, and "backward-looking reasons," which are not. Thus "I'm buying a Jersey cow," gives a forward-looking reason for going to Hereford Market, but "He killed my father," gives a backward-looking reason for killing him. Anscombe denies, however, that backward-looking reasons can be starting points of practical reasoning. She instead models practical reasoning on Aristotle's practical syllogism, which always starts from something pursued or wanted. To act on a forward-looking reason is to be "attracted to something ostensibly good that is seen to require implementation," and this counts as reasoning. To act on a backward-looking reason is to be "prompted by an ostensible fact that is seen to call for a response," and Anscombe unfairly refuses to count this as reasoning (245n5). Anscombe is thus committed to the idea that your rationality, in the sense of sound practical reasoning, "could depend on ultimate purposes that you pursue, but not on the kind of backward-looking reasons, or motives, on which you act." Müller sees this as a mistake (249).

Here Müller assumes that we cannot capture the rationality of acting on backward-looking reasons by attending only to forward-looking reasons. But one might question this. Suppose my reason for killing Jules is that Jules killed my father. Does this mean my action is intentional under the description "responding to my father's murder by killing the one who killed him?" If so, then it seems we can capture the rationality (or irrationality) of the action by looking just at the forward-looking reason supplied by this further intention. Anticipating such concerns, Müller replies that insofar as responding to the murder is acting because of the past fact, the objection already presupposes the existence of a backward-looking reason. I expect this issue to attract a good deal of attention in the years to come, as Anscombe's readers connect her action theory with the topics of character and virtue.

Many of the articles shed light on some notoriously baffling thing Anscombe says in Intention. Anton Ford's "Action and Generality" is especially successful on this score. Ford takes upAnscombe's denial that actions are intentional in virtue of some "extra feature" that distinguishes them from unintentional actions or mere events. He reads this as a rejection of what Anscombeelsewhere calls the "standard approach" in the philosophy of action. On the standard approach, we ask what distinguishes actions from other events, and then we ask what distinguishes intentional actions from other actions. At each stage we expect a "two-step" explanation. The first step is to isolate a genus that we presume is already understood, and the second is to identify the feature that distinguishes the thing we want to understand from other things that fall under the genus. The method thus parallels the case of explaining what a snub nose is by isolating the genus nose and then saying a snub nose is a nose with the further feature of being concave.

Anscombe apparently thinks that when it comes to intentional action there is no such further feature. What she doesn't tell us, though, is how there could fail to be such a feature. It seems that if intentional action is a species of the genus action, and if action is a species of the genus event, then there simply must be a two-step explanation in each case. Ford's first aim in the paper is to explain how there can be species for which there is no two-step explanation. His second is to argue that action and intentional action are such species.

Ford argues that there are in fact three kinds of species-genus relation, and the two-step approach works for only one. Snub nose is an "accidental species" of nose. But horse is a "categorial species" of animal, and pure gold is an "essential species" of gold. Something is an accidental species of a genus when both the genus and the differentia can be explained without making reference to the other terms in the equation. Thus we can explain nose without referring to concave or snub nose, and we can explain concave without referring to nose or snub nose. In that case, Ford says, a two-step explanation is possible.

With horse things are different. Ford argues that if there is a quality that distinguishes a horse from all other animals it will be a quality that only animals have. Clearly it must also be a quality that no other animal has. So it must be a quality unique to horses. (This makes it different from concave, since concavity is not unique to snub noses.) Ford concludes that no such quality could provide a two-step explanation, since any such explanation would be circular. "Since such a quality can in principle only belong to one thing, an account of the quality will have to make reference to this very kind of thing" (86)

As it stands this does not look like a good argument. It is true that concavity is not unique to snub noses, but features that are unique to their species are often used in two-step explanations. For instance, the feature of being divisible only by itself and one is arguably unique to prime numbers. Only a number can have this feature, and no other kind of number can have it. But there is nothing circular about explaining prime number as a number that is divisible only by itself and one.

While Ford's position on horse is disputable, he has other examples of species for which there is no two-step explanation. For instance, he argues that while there is a value for x in the equation "nose + x = snub nose," there is nothing to put in for x in the equation "color + x = red." There is a difference between having some color or other and being red, but this difference cannot be explained by citing some feature that red things have other than their being, precisely, red. Ford also argues that there is nothing to put in for x in the equation "gold + x = pure gold." "For there is nothing extra that gold must be, over and above being gold, in order to be pure."

The two examples are importantly different, though. Whatever goes in for x in these equations must be "logically independent," Ford says, both of the genus and of the species. What blocks a two-step explanation of red is that there is no value for x that is independent of the species, namely red. What blocks a two-step explanation of pure gold is that there is no value for x that is independent of the genus, namely gold. The difference between pure gold and impure gold is just that impure gold contains something that is, precisely, not gold.

Ford goes on to argue that action stands to intentional action as gold stands to pure gold, and that event stands to action as color stands to red. Just as there is nothing extra that gold must be to be gold, so there is nothing extra that action must be to be intentional action. And just as red is not the sum of color and anything else, so action is not the sum of event and anything else. The standard approach is thus doubly mistaken. On the standard approach, both action and intentional action are assumed to be accidental species, for which we should seek two-step explanations.

Ford really does succeed, I think, in explaining how there could fail to be an "extra feature." He gives us a clear picture of what it would be to abandon the standard approach. This is a huge advance. The paper also stands out for its accessibility to a general audience. It is required reading in my undergraduate course on reason and action, and would enhance many courses in areas outside of action theory.