Ethics for Enemies: Terror, Torture and War

In this monograph based on her Uehiro Lectures at Oxford University, F. M. Kamm applies theoretical perspectives and distinctions she developed elsewhere[1] to some aspects of three related areas of practical moral concern, namely, torture, terrorism and war (with one chapter devoted to each of these areas). More specifically, she discusses: (1) the moral justification for torturing those responsible for creating lethal threats (as in, for example, ticking-time-bomb scenarios); (2) whether the intention to harm innocent civilians accounts for the special wrongness of terrorism; and (3) two of the conditions necessary for going to war according to traditional just war theory, namely, right reason (e.g., self-defence) and the need to avoid evil effects which are disproportionately large relative to the good effects. This book displays the impressive conceptual sophistication, argumentative rigor and use of imaginary examples characteristic of Kamm’s philosophical work. It is a valuable addition to the theoretical literature.

Regarding the moral justification for torturing those responsible for creating lethal threats, Kamm begins with a critique of the views of Henry Shue and David Sussman (respectively) on the concept of torture. She makes many telling points against the arguments of both Shue and Sussman with respect to their definitions of torture and the permissibility of torture. She argues convincingly that under certain circumstances it is morally permissible to torture those morally responsible for creating lethal threats. Here she relies principally, as others do,[2] on the fact that other things being equal it might be morally preferable to torture someone for a relatively brief period than to kill them (supposing lethal force to be morally justified in the absence of less harmful responses). However, she offers a highly nuanced account that considers a variety of complications, including that the victim might value death over the humiliation (as the victim sees it) of even a relatively brief period of torture, and that torture might be more psychological repulsive than killing.

Kamm's arguments in favour of a wide understanding of torture as (roughly speaking) "the intentional and direct infliction of severe mental or physical suffering" (the Oxford Dictionary definition (p. 14)) are less convincing. Here I note that since she does not provide her own definition, or even explicit general characterisation, the phenomenon is left underspecified.[3] However, her discussion of the example of a medical procedure involving the infliction of excruciating pain as the means to prevent -- as opposed to a side effect of -- coma indicates that she does not think that it is a necessary condition for an act to be torture that the 'victim' does not consent to it (or that it is not undertaken for the 'victim's' good (p. 60, n. 31)).

Kamm constructs a wide range of imaginary examples involving the deliberate infliction of extreme suffering. However, a number of the most important of these might not be regarded by many as instances of torture. Accordingly, her analyses of these examples, while possibly interesting in their own right, might be thought by some to be somewhat beside the point in the context of a discussion of torture. Nor is this merely a verbal point, as Kamm in effect suggests (p. 67, n. 53). For if Kamm's understanding of torture is excessively permissive then it might fail to pick out morally significant features of torture (or at the very least significantly understate them): features which might render torture morally permissible or impermissible, but not (say) the deliberate infliction of excruciating pain per se (given that the latter does not necessarily possess these features). That torture is an assault on individual autonomy -- and is so not primarily because the torture victim does not give consent -- is arguably one such feature.[4] Such a feature might enable us to differentiate between torture and, for example, unconsented to ordeals in military training -- assume that the soldiers are unwilling conscripts -- involving the deliberate infliction of gradated excruciating pain in order to test and gradually strengthen self-control and, therefore, autonomy (in one of its aspects). It is precisely because of this differentiating feature that one might conceivably think that the routine use of such training ordeals in wartime could be justified on national security grounds, whereas the routine use of torture could not.

In her discussion of Shue and Sussman, Kamm argues -- by way of counter-example -- that, firstly, being defenceless is not a necessary condition for being a victim of torture and, secondly, that someone being tortured can, nevertheless, constitute a threat to their torturer. Regarding the first point, she gives the example of someone who unsuccessfully uses a shield to protect himself against a would-be torturer (p. 7). This seems to conflate the claim that the victim is defenceless during the torture process with the claim that the victim is defenceless against the commencement of the torture process.[5] In the shield example the latter claim is false but the former one is true; the torturer goes to work only having dispensed with the victim's shield. However, it is the falsity of the claim that the victim is defenceless during the torture process that is required if Shue and Sussman (and many other commentators) are to be refuted.

Regarding the second point, she makes use of the imaginary example of a torturer who transmits excruciatingly painful electric shocks to an attacker to prevent this attacker from killing a third person (pp. 7-8, 13). Apparently, the attacker constitutes a threat to the third person notwithstanding that the attacker is being tortured (and is defenceless against the electric shocks). However, it is not intuitively obvious to me that this is a case of torture, although it is certainly a case of deliberately inflicting excruciating pain on another person. Perhaps this shows that such far-fetched imaginary examples have limited utility in adjudicating philosophical disputes, albeit they can be helpful in illustrating fine-grained conceptual distinctions. At any rate, consider a woman who is being raped but who is, nevertheless, still in control of the movement of her jaws and who decides in desperation to sink her teeth into the closely proximate face of her attacker causing him excruciating pain; she bites harder and harder until he finally desists. It would be odd to claim that the poor woman is engaged in torturing her attacker. Arguably a better description is that she is engaged in self-defence by deliberately inflicting excruciating pain on her attacker. By parity of reasoning, arguably a better description of Kamm's own example is that the person transmitting electric shocks is engaged in the defence of the life of the third person by deliberately inflicting excruciating pain on the attacker (but is, nevertheless, not torturing the attacker).

Notwithstanding Kamm’s above inconclusive electric shock transmitter example, the victims of torture can constitute a threat in some sense to their torturers (or to others). So Kamm’s general claim that a torture victim can constitute a threat is correct. Here she follows other theorists[6] in using ticking bomb scenarios to illustrate just this possibility. The ticking bomb placed by the terrorist (and now victim of torture) is a threat to the lives of others including, perhaps, the torturer; and, crucially, remains a threat during the torture process. Note that in this kind of example the bomb has been placed prior to the commencement of the torture process and on one plausible analysis the situation is as follows. The terrorist's basic action (so to speak) -- that of planting the bomb and setting the clock -- has been performed. However, the terrorist's more complex action -- that of intentionally killing people by means of exploding the bomb (by means of his basic action of planting the bomb and setting the clock) -- is only partially complete: the bomb has not gone off yet, although it will do so unless someone intervenes. (Note also that the intention attached to the terrorist's complex action does not cease to exist once the basic action of planting the bomb and setting the clock has been completed.) The key point to be made here is that constituting a threat in this sense is consistent with not being in control of one's body during the period after completion of one's basic action but prior to the completion of one's complex action; for the completion of one's complex action, having performed its constitutive basic action, does not require any further bodily action on one's part.[7] This kind of case is referred to as ex post torture by Kamm (pp. 35-36) on the grounds that the torture takes place after the action of the torture victim has been completed. However, by the lights of the above action-analysis – which, it should be said, is not necessarily accepted by Kamm - the (complex) action of the torture victim is incomplete and, therefore, the torture is not ex post. I return to this below. Before doing so let me now turn directly to the matter of the torturer's control of the victim's body.

Many, if not most, theorists of torture hold that the torturer is, at least to a significant degree, in control of the victim's body during the torture process. As Kamm notes, Sussman argues for a strong version of this claim. Kamm argues convincingly against Sussman's stronger claims, e.g., that the victim's body is now an instrument (agent?) of the torturer to be turned against the victim. However, there might be more acceptable weaker versions of the claim. Perhaps, for example, the torturer is in control of the victim's body during the torture process at least to the extent of being able to prevent the victim from (i) preventing the torturer from torturing the victim and (ii) launching an attack on the torturer (where the attack in question is constituted by a bodily action performed during the torture process).

The most novel element of Kamm's conceptually sophisticated discussion of torture is her suggestion that the problem of morally justifying torture lies not with torture in particular but rather with ex post harm in general (p. 37). Certainly ex post harming in relation to wrongdoing is morally problematic in ways in which harming in order to prevent wrongdoing is not. For example, torture as a form of retributive punishment is very hard, if not impossible, to justify. (I am not saying that Kamm thinks that the ex postness of the harm done in the ticking bomb scenarios is conceptually the same as the ex postness of harm done in cases of retributive punishment.) Accordingly, if the cases of torture in question, i.e., those most plausibly thought of as morally permissible, were genuine instances of ex post harming, then Kamm's suggestion might well be convincing. However, as we saw earlier, by the lights of at least one plausible action-analysis, the relevant ticking bomb scenarios are not genuine instances of ex post harming since the torture takes place prior to the completion of the torture victim's (complex) action and, indeed, is performed as a means to prevent its completion. On the other hand, Kamm may be offering an account of ex postness which is somewhat wider than the action-analysis I have offered admits of (and yet narrower than that in play in cases of retributive punishment). If so I have not been able to grasp it. That said, perhaps Kamm's point is in essence that it may well be thought to be morally preferable to attempt to save innocent lives by harming the terrorist in a ticking bomb scenario (e.g. by beating them within an inch of their lives) at the point at which they are attempting to plant and set the bomb (thereby preventing the basic action) rather than to do so by the same or comparable means after that point (thereby preventing the complex action). (See her surgery example (p. 36-7)). If so, then the later beating might seem ex post (in some sense, e.g. ex post one’s bodily action) and also explanatory of the moral difference between the beatings. However, I am unable to see any significant difference between the earlier and the later beatings in this scenario; both are morally permissible, I would have thought, or neither are. Moreover, even if the point were to be accepted, the possible reasons for this are manifold, e.g. the greater likelihood of success if the earlier intervention is made.

I note that the above account of the ticking bomb scenario as involving an incomplete action is not to be identified with the interpretation Kamm ascribes to Sussman according to which the torture victim (Terrorist Bomber) has "started a threat and refrains from giving information that could stop it" (p. 38). Consider a person (Bomb Contractor) who has been contracted to plant the bomb and set the clock, who knows that it will -- unless someone intervenes -- explode killing people, but who does not have an intention to kill these people by means of exploding the bomb (by means of his basic action of planting the bomb and setting the clock). Bomb Contractor's only action -- a basic action -- was completed when he planted the bomb and set the clock and, correspondingly, the intention attached to this basic action -- his only relevant intention -- ceased to exist at that time.

Note that Bomb Contractor's later refraining from giving the information that could stop the bomb exploding is not evidence of a continuing complex intention to kill by means of the bomb. Rather, he is refraining, let us assume, only because he fears that his terrorist employer would kill him were the terrorist to discover any such disclosure. If it were not for his fear he would happily provide the information. Of course, if this analysis of Bomb Contractor's intentions and corresponding actions is correct then torturing Bomb Contractor would be a case of ex post harming. Moreover, there may well be a greater reluctance to torture Bomb Contractor than Terrorist Bomber, and the fact that it would be ex post harming may well be at least part of the reason for this (although perhaps the absence of an intention on the part of Bomb Contractor to actually kill people might be an even larger part). However, this would not demonstrate that the standard kinds of cases used to justify torture -- standard 'ticking bomb' scenarios -- involve ex post harm and that, therefore, ex post harm explains why in such cases torture is believed by some to be morally impermissible.

Kamm's second chapter, on whether the intention to harm (innocent) civilians accounts for the special wrongness of terrorism, begins with what Kamm calls Standard Terrorism (ST) (p. 74). According to ST, terrorism involves death or grave injury to civilians as a means to terrorise other civilians. However, according to Kamm, "This agent intends, rather than merely foresees, the harm and terror to his victims, either as a means or as an end in itself" (p. 74).

ST is not quite the standard account of terrorism.[8] For, contra ST, terrorist groups do not kill civilians as an end-in-itself or, if some members of some groups might do so on occasion, terrorist groups do not typically have the killing of civilians as their primary end, but rather principally as a means to their primary end. This is what distinguishes terrorists (e.g., the IRA who killed civilians as a means to their political objectives) from genocidal groups (e.g., the Interahamwe in Rwanda who killed hundreds of thousands of Tutsis in an attempt to eliminate them). (This is one reason Kamm's central example, Baby Killer Nation (see below), is more plausibly regarded not as a terrorist group but rather as a highly unusual (actually, incredible) genocidal group.)

By the lights of ST, terrorists are not state actors, although Kamm does countenance the possibility of state-sponsored terrorism (p. 74). However, state terrorism (as opposed to state-sponsored terrorism) has arguably been the principal form of terrorism throughout history.[9] Consider, for example, the state terrorism during the Reign of Terror in the French Revolution or that of Stalin, which, in the twentieth century, involved the death of millions. So perhaps Kamm's characterisation of terrorism unduly narrows the focus of her discussion, and not least because the institutionalisation of terrorism in a polity may well put issues of individual intention to harm, foreseeable harm, moral responsibility (individual and collective) for harm and so on in a different moral light. Nor does Kamm consider the important problem posed for definitions of terrorism by non-innocent civilians who are neither combatants, nor the leaders of combatants, nor those who otherwise authorise combatant activities (e.g., voters in a democracy).[10]

Kamm's principal concern is whether the intention to harm (innocent) civilians accounts for the special wrongness of terrorist activity. (The concern here is not with the goodness or badness of terrorists; the goodness and badness of agents obviously depends on their intentions and this is not in dispute.) In relation to this concern Kamm argues that "when an act is otherwise morally permissible despite the harm and terror it produces, intending the harm and terror as a means or ends need not affect the permissibility of the act" (p. 78).

Kamm offers the example already mentioned of Baby Killer Nation (BKN) (p. 79). BKN intentionally kills and terrorises children (innocent civilians) as an end-in-itself and also as a means to protest pro-natalism. However, BKN only kills when it has a justified (moral and legal, I assume, although these seem to be conflated) pretext to do so in order to escape punishment. For example, BKN bombs a building housing Nazi combatants with the consequence that the objectives of the just war against the Nazis are furthered, albeit at the cost of the lives of some children who reside nearby (they are collateral damage). However, these civilian deaths are a morally acceptable cost by the lights of just war theory (specifically, the principles of necessity and proportionality). Accordingly, the building would be a legitimate (in terms of international law and (presumably) morality) military target of some armed resistance group engaged in morally justified armed conflict against the Nazis. However, BKN bombs the building only as a means to kill the nearby children, whereas the resistance would do so without this intention (albeit, the death of the children would be an unintended but foreseen consequence).

BKN is akin to a homicidal maniac who goes to war in order to kill people as an end-in-itself, but who conforms to the laws of war in order to escape punishment; so the laws constrain his killing. On Kamm's view, the homicidal-maniac-soldier would not be guilty of murder. Assuming murder is unlawful killing, and the law in question mirrors the relevant moral principles, this seems right.

In Kamm's view BKN should not be regarded as a terrorist group (a conceptual definitional claim, albeit one, I suggest, with descriptive moral loading). For apparently BKN does not do anything that the resistance group engaged in morally and legally legitimate military action would not have done -- and the members of the resistance group are not terrorists. Kamm reasonably concludes that intentionally killing civilians to terrorise other civilians to achieve a political purpose is not a sufficient condition for terrorism.[11]

One response to this on the part of those who hold that the intention to harm (innocent) civilians is, if not a sufficient condition, then at least a necessary condition and (crucially) one that accounts for the special wrongness of terrorism, would be to add the requirement that terrorist action be violent action that ought to be criminalised; indeed, this requirement can be independently motivated.[12]However, this move might seem ad hoc as a response to Kamm's BKN example. I return to this matter below.

Kamm goes on to make an interesting (narrow) normative theoretical claim, namely, that when an act is otherwise morally permissible (notwithstanding the harm it produces), intending the harm need not affect the permissibility of the act. If this claim is correct then it is not obvious how the intention to harm (innocent) civilians can account for the special wrongness of terrorism.

However, I am not sure that Kamm succeeds in adequately justifying the claim that when an act is otherwise morally permissible (notwithstanding the harm it produces), intending the harm need not affect the permissibility of the act -- at least in so far as she relies on BKN for this justification. (I do not have the space to comment on her noncase-based justification (p. 82-3)). For there is apparently a further relevant feature of BKN that has thus far escaped notice, namely, a certain second-order, good intention.

The first point to be made here is that BKN intends to (or is otherwise aiming to) escape punishment, and has as a means to this end its compliance with legally enshrined just war principles. The question is whether BKN complies intentionally or merely as a foreseen consequence of its action of bombing the building. It seems to me that compliance with the just war principles is not adequately described as a mere foreseen side-effect of the bombing. (By the way, this (at least in theory if not in practice) might be consistent with Kamm's claim that the death of the Nazi occupants of the building was foreseen but not intended). For these principles are accepted by BKN as a constraint on its activities, and BKN surely scrutinised its planned actions and their consequences, and if necessary would have adjusted its actions, to ensure that they complied with these principles (albeit in order to escape punishment) by, for example, ensuring that the bomb will not kill more civilians than would be justified under the principles. Moreover, if the principles were more permissive, then BKN would no doubt have taken advantage of this to (say) explode a bigger bomb that would have killed even more civilians (assuming a bigger bomb was the only one available). Accordingly, it seems to me that BKN intentionally complies with the principles in order to escape punishment or, at least, that it is far from clear that this is not so. If this is right then the bad terroristic intention is constrained by this good, just war theoretic intention; the latter being a second-order intention with respect to the former. In this respect BKN is akin to our homicidal-maniac-soldier.

Importantly, it is plausible that it is this intentional adherence to (legally enshrined) just war theoretic moral principles that accounts for our intuition that BKN is not a terrorist group (or, for that matter, a genocidal group). (I note that if this is so then Kamm has implicitly introduced into her example non-compliance with the above-mentioned requirement for a group to be a terrorist group, viz., that its activities ought to be criminalised.)

This suggests that Kamm is right in thinking that the intention to kill (innocent) civilians does not in her example make a difference to the moral permissibility of the action of BKN. However, it also suggests that she is wrong about the reason for this. The intention to kill innocent civilians fails to make a difference to the (all things considered) moral permissibility of BKN's action, not for the reason that this bad intention does not in itself make any (pro tanto) moral difference, but rather for the reason that there is another intention in play which neutralises its moral effect: the above-described second-order, good intention with respect to this bad intention. This second-order good intention acts as a constraint on the bad intention in question (and, therefore, on the bad intentional actions -- acts of terrorism (or genocide) -- that would otherwise be performed by BKN).

Accordingly, for all that Kamm has shown, the bad intention to harm innocent civilians does account for the special wrong of terrorism (though it is not a sufficient condition for terrorism). It is just that the presence of a good second-order intention with respect to that bad intention can transform an otherwise morally impermissible terrorist action into a permissible (non-terrorist) action.

In her third essay, on the relationship between two of just war theory's conditions, namely, right reason and proportionality, Kamm makes use of an interesting distinction between goals of action and conditions of action in order to make a variety of theoretical points. These points include (in the first section) that (contra the jus ad bellum of just war theory) one may not need to have a proper intention (a species of right reason) in order for it to be permissible to start a war, and (in the second section) that additional goods might help justify a war by making it proportional, if those goods were a condition but not a goal of war. For reasons of space I will restrict my comments to the first point.

A proper intention, e.g., A starting a war against B with the intention to prevent B's genocidal activity against C, may well be an end-in-itself. However, this does not seem necessary; it could be an intended, or otherwise aimed at, means which was not an end in itself, e.g., A's starting a war against B with intention to prevent B's genocidal activity against C but intending to do so only as a means to enable A's access to C's oil resources thereafter.[13]

In order make good her claim that waging permissible war need not require a proper intention, but rather only acting on a morally desirable condition of a certain sort, Kamm offers her Weden example. Weden goes to war against Germany when Germany is engaging in a genocidal war of aggression against Norway, but does so only in order to secure access to Norway's oil resources. Weden knows that if it stops Germany's aggression and genocide Norway will favour it in the subsequent oil negotiations. Accordingly, (in the salient version of the Weden example, pp. 121-2), Weden directly attacks the German controlled Norwegian oil facilities in order to get immediate control of them. Weden's control of the oil is presumably temporary and the oil will be surrendered to the Norwegians in due course. However, in the meantime the successful attack has the foreseen effect of causing Germany to abandon its aggression and genocidal activity and thereby facilitate Weden's self-interested desire for access to Norwegian oil.

Kamm claims that in this example Weden does not have a proper intention (getting access to Norwegian oil is not a proper intention since not a right reason for waging war), but, nevertheless, Weden does act on a (morally desirable) condition, namely, the cessation of Germany's aggression and genocidal activity -- which condition serves as a pretext for waging war (see the above discussion of BKN).

However, it is not clear that in the example provided the desirable condition in question (the cessation of aggression and genocidal activity) was not in fact intended, or otherwise aimed at, by Weden; and, therefore, was not available to serve as a proper intention for Weden waging war (and, other things being equal, render Weden's war morally permissible). More specifically, and notwithstanding Kamm's claims to the contrary -- including the interesting claim that a condition can be a foreseen means to some end one has without necessarily being intended (p. 125) -- it is not clear that the condition in question was not in fact aimed at by Weden as a means to secure its access to Norwegian oil.

In the example, Weden has one end-in-itself, namely, to get access to the oil, and its waging war on Germany is intended by Weden to somehow function at least in part as a means to this end. Moreover, as I understand the example, Weden envisages a causal chain commencing with its attack on Germany and terminating in Norway’s providing access to the oil. The missing link in the causal chain is the cessation of Germany's aggression and genocidal activity; this condition is caused by Weden's attack on Germany, and it in turn is the causal pre-condition for Weden getting access to the oil.[14] Kamm's claim is that this condition is not intended (or otherwise aimed at) by Weden, but is rather only foreseen. The counter-claim is that this condition was aimed at as a means to get Weden access to the oil.

The counter-claim has the virtue of providing a satisfactory means-end explanation of Weden's intentional attack on Germany; the attack was made in order to realise the condition (cessation of Germany's aggression and genocidal activity) which was in turn intended as a necessary part of the means to securing the oil. However, the only obvious alternative account seems inadequate, or at least unclear.

It is important to note that Weden does not attack Germany as a direct means to its ultimate end of securing access to the oil, as would be the case if, for example, Weden believed that merely attacking Germany (perhaps unsuccessfully) would be sufficient to get the desired access.[15] So Weden knows it needs to do more than simply attack Germany; Weden knows it has to cause the cessation of Germany's aggression and genocidal activity by means of its attack on Germany, if it is to get access to the oil. Indeed, Weden has no reason to attack Germany other than to cause the cessation of Germany's aggression and genocidal activity. So Weden attacks Germany as a means to cause this condition. If so, surely Weden is aiming at this condition. After all, Weden's mere belief that the attack will cause the condition does not in and of itself explain Weden's mounting the attack. If one merely believes some outcome will be caused by an action, this is not normally a sufficient reason for performing the action. For in addition one needs to desire the outcome (either in itself or as a means to some further outcome), in which case one then performs the intentionally performed action in order to bring about, i.e., aiming at, the outcome.

I note that it is consistent with the claim that the condition of the cessation of Germany's aggression and genocidal activity was intended (or otherwise aimed at) by Weden that this condition is a desirable condition on Weden's attack in Kamm's sense. For in addition to this condition being a key part of the means in Weden's self-interested strategy to secure oil, it also serves as a pretext for Weden's attack; it is a condition which morally (and, presumably, legally) justifies the attack.