Heaven and Earth Are Not Humane: The Problem of Evil in Classical Chinese Philosophy

The intriguing title, Heaven and Earth Are Not Humane, a line that originally appears in the Daodejing of Laozi, draws the reader into early Chinese philosophy. By exploring the problem of evil, Franklin Perkins opens new doors into this ancient tradition. The problem of evil in this book specifically refers to the fact that bad things happen to good people. Perkins examines the multiplicity of ways that philosophers of the Warring States period dealt with the problem of evil. His study focuses on six major texts, the Lunyu, Mozi, Daodejing, Mengzi, Zhuangzi, and Xunzi, but he incorporates a variety of recently excavated texts such as Xing zi ming chu, Taiyi sheng shui, and Qiong da yi shi into his study as well.

One of the book's virtues is that Perkins unravels the diverse and complex relations among the views of the various texts he studies. Going beyond common perceptions of the Confucianism-Mohism opposition or the Lao-Zhuang Daoist tradition, he sometimes aligns the Mozi with the Daodejing, or the Mengzi with the Zhuangzi, and sometimes contrasts the Xunzi with the Daodejing, depending on the issue being discussed. Furthermore, instead of suggesting highly speculative interconnections among various positions, Perkins plainly lays out the intricacies of early Chinese philosophy as they are. Another virtue is that by focusing his study on the problem of evil, he is able to deal with a series of interrelated issues including, among others: the relationships between heaven and humans and between heaven and nature, the efficacy of human actions, the status of human beings with regard to the rest of the natural world, and the conception of virtue as ethical actions and power. Perkins provides a vibrant and dynamic portrayal of early Chinese philosophy.

In the first chapter, Perkins gives a general introduction to the problem of evil. This chapter is divided into four sections. The first discusses ways in which the problem of evil can be applied in an early Chinese context. Perkins problematizes the predominant notion of the unity between heaven and humans in Chinese thought. He argues that the problem of evil leads us to trace the conflict and division between heaven and humans. The second section introduces concrete historical accounts concerning the problem of evil derived from various sources. The third section goes back to examine an earlier Chinese view that denied the problem of evil: the Zhou doctrine of the Mandate of Heaven. The last section outlines various formulations of the problem of evil in European thought.

Chapter 2 examines debates about heaven and fatalism between early Confucianism and Mohism. Perkins starts with the early Confucian view, primarily as represented in the Lunyu. According to Perkins, there is no coherent view on heaven and fate in the Lunyu; instead, we find two incompatible positions: on the one hand, Kongzi (Confucius) supported the idea that heaven is a moral authority, and on the other hand, Kongzi considered heaven to be morally indifferent, allowing that bad things happen to good people (fate). However, from the Mohists' perspective, the Confucians were contradicting themselves because they were saying we should do our best, but, at the same time, were saying the results depend on fate. In response to this, the Mohists argued that heaven always rewards good people and punishes bad people. Perkins points out that the Mohists' promotion of the goodness of heaven plays an important role in justifying the efficacy of human action and emphasizing human responsibility. However, he notes that the Mohists did not completely ignore the limits of human efficacy. Quoting A. C. Graham's point that both Confucian and Mohist conceptions of fate and human efficacy are in some sense well-intended "fictions," Perkins argues that the critical difference between the Confucians and Mohists is not merely about the truth of the world, but more about the practical effects of their doctrines. In other words, the Mohists' appeal to a moral heaven serves to stimulate hard work, while Confucian fatalism serves to redirect people's motivation from external rewards to internal concern for self-cultivation.

Despite this important difference in their conceptions of heaven, Perkins points out that the Confucians and Mohists shared important commonalities: both were activists and moralists, and more fundamentally, the ethics of each was humanistic and anthropocentric.

In Chapter 3, Perkins turns to the Daodejing, a text that left behind the anthropocentrism of the Confucians and Mohists. As mentioned earlier, "heaven and earth are not humane" is taken from a line that appears in the Daodejing. According to Perkins, this phrase does not mean that heaven and earth are malicious, but rather that they do not follow the moral standards imposed by human beings. In the Daodejing, heaven became less anthropomorphic, became more like modern conceptions of nature. It gave a prominent position to the concept of the dao: the way nature works. With regard to dao, Perkins makes two important points. First, the process of nature is constant or regular. Following the constant order of nature will bring us success in general, such as long life and peace. This implies that the Daodejing grants human action immense power to determine the course and quality of human life. Second, the process of nature is so-of-itself; it is a spontaneous process, free from external coercion. Thus, living in accordance with spontaneous nature brings us success, and so, "the most effective action is non-action -- that is, not forcing or coercing things but letting them develop of themselves" (p. 103). Perkins also draws a comparison between the Daodejing and the Mozi. Even though both thinkers highlight the efficacy of human action, they differ from each other on two major points; heaven is moral in the Mozi but amoral in the Daodejing, and unlike the Mozi, the Daodejing is deeply anti-activist (non-action).

Chapter 4 focuses on the Mengzi. According to Perkins, the tension between the two sides of heaven (moral authority and indifferent fate) in the Lunyu intensified in the Mengzi. Very much like the Daodejing, heaven became more naturalistic in the Mengzi. For example, Mengzi's cyclical view of history moving between order and disorder shows that heaven has no particular concern for human well-being; in good times, the good are rewarded, but not in bad times. Therefore, Perkins notes, in the Mengzi the power of human action was quite limited, and heaven was no longer a direct model for human action. Instead, Mengzi turned his gaze from the external world of heaven to human nature, xing. According to Mengzi, human beings are born with natural dispositions toward virtue, and in the right environment, these natural dispositions grow to become full-blown virtues in the way that plants and trees grow from seeds. These moral dispositions are given by heaven and we should follow the moral imperatives within us. In this scheme, our pursuit of virtue is no longer a mere means to rewards or benefits. Rather, virtues are their own rewards, and cultivating virtues is something that is within our control. Consequently, Perkins points out that in the Mengzi human beings did not completely break their ties with heaven, but their relationship to heaven was mediated through human nature, which is given by heaven.

In Chapter 5 Perkins moves on to the Zhuangzi, paying particular attention to a radical strand in the Inner Chapters. He observes that, as in the Mengzi, heaven in the Zhuangzi is indifferent to human concerns and values. However, unlike Mengzi's heaven, which grants a special position to human beings by giving moral dispositions to them, heaven in the Zhuangzi treats all the myriad things equally. For Zhuangzi, human beings are just one of the myriad things, and all the myriad things are just what they are in their unique singularity. Accordingly, from the perspective of Zhuangzi, the Mengzian normative conception of human nature is a form of violence, forcing social norms and human values on human beings and harming the singularity of individuals. Therefore, one of the key points in the Zhuangzi is that we should give up such anthropocentric perspectives and follow heaven, which does not discriminate good from bad, life from death, or harm from benefit. Perkins notes that once one transcends categories of good and bad, there will be no problem of evil. And so, for the Zhuangzi, "the fundamental question is no longer how we can act effectively to achieve our desires, but how we can alter our desires in order to enjoy the world as it is" (p. 171). In this sense, Zhuangzi's view is close to that of Mengzi, who tried to redirect our attention from external rewards to the internal goods that come from virtue. Nevertheless, Perkins points out a significant difference between the two: Mengzi's view is somehow tragic because he accepts certain bad outcomes as unavoidable, whereas Zhuangzi's freedom to alter our perspective leads us to overcome tragedy and wander through life with joy and ease.

In Chapter 6, Perkins describes Xunzi as an advocate of the strongest form of humanism. As discussed above, Mengzi accepted the problem of evil, Zhuangzi tried to transcend it, and the Mozi and Daodejing tried to minimize it by highlighting the efficacy of human action. Perkins aligns Xunzi more closely with the Mozi and Daodejing because Xunzi also put great emphasis on the power of human action. However, Perkins points out that Xunzi parts company with them in his view on heaven. Unlike the Mozi and Daodejing, which considered heaven as a guide for human actions, Xunzi regarded heaven to be amoral nature and replaced heaven with human culture as the proper source of our guidance. For Xunzi, it is human beings who construct the ritual and social hierarchy that ensure the prosperity of the good and eliminate the problem of evil. Perkins argues that this clear demarcation between heaven and humans is a declaration of human power and independence; in the Xunzi, human beings control their own destinies. Consequently, Xunzi completely broke with Mengzi's tragic worldview. In addition, Xunzi shifted his attention from the Mengzian emphasis on the heart's spontaneous emotional response to the heart's distinctive capacity to deliberate.

All in all, I generally agree with Perkins' illuminating interpretation and analysis of early Chinese philosophy, but I have one minor disagreement concerning the way he lumps Mengzi together with Kongzi. To some extent, this is understandable given the fact that Kongzi's comments on heaven and fate in the Lunyu are very terse, often abstruse, and lack any specific context. But still, I think we find slight but significantly different attitudes toward the tragic events of human life in the Lunyu and the Mengzi. Philip J. Ivanhoe provides such a contrasting picture of Kongzi and Mengzi: "An admission of struggle and doubt would be more characteristic of Confucius than Mencius. Mencius never seems to experience, or at least reveal, the personal struggle and doubt we find in the record of Confucius's teachings."^[1]

In addition, I think that Perkins' use of the term "fatalism" in his description of Confucianism is, if not mistaken, potentially quite misleading. Fatalism is the belief that events are fixed in advance and unchangeable by human agency.^[2] However, as Perkins himself claims, a plausible reading of the early Confucian view would be that "In general, good people succeed and bad people are punished, but there are no guarantees" (p. 62). Accordingly, I think, "fatalistic" rather than "fatalism" would be more accurate in describing the view of the early Ru.

Another ambitious goal of this book is, to quote Perkins' own words, "a kind of hybrid between European philosophy and Chinese philosophy, generating something that would not have been possible without both" (p. 3). He mentions that his book was inspired by Susan Neiman's Evil in Modern Thought, and he frames his project as a work of "comparative philosophy," "world philosophy," or "intercultural philosophy."^[3] Perkins does bring up significant issues and ideas drawn from discussions in modern European thought whenever he thinks they are relevant. At times, he swiftly moves between various European philosophers such as Spinoza, Nietzsche, and Kant. Of course, we can define "comparative philosophy" broadly, but in my view, this book is not really "comparative" in a strict sense. First of all, it allots a vastly disproportionate number of pages to the study of Chinese philosophers, and second, unlike the discussions of Chinese thinkers, in the sections focused on European thought the various philosophers are mixed together and presented as a single group. As a consequence, philosophers who do not have background in Chinese thought are likely to find the Chinese part more appealing and interesting, while philosophers who do not have a background in European thought will probably find the European part difficult to access and appreciate.

Nevertheless, this book makes a significant contribution to our understanding early Chinese philosophy. I recommend it highly.