Neo-Confucianism: Metaphysics, Mind, and Morality

This book is clearly one of the greatest accomplishments among English Neo-Confucian philosophical studies in recent decades. JeeLoo Liu uses clear language and rigorous philosophical reasoning to analyze eight pivotal Neo-Confucian figures regarding three major areas: metaphysics, moral theory and moral practice. The book can be aptly used as both an introduction to Neo-Confucianism for beginners and a top reference for researchers, which is itself a rare achievement.

One reason why Liu's research simultaneously manifests accessibility and finesse is that she chooses very suitable Western theories to comparatively interpret Neo-Confucianism, without over-complicating or misrepresenting issues discussed by the latter. For instance, pragmatist metaphysics (153), the social-cognitive model of moral personality (185), and evolutionary psychology (246) are incorporated to comparatively illuminate, respectively, Lu Xiangshan and Wang Yangming's seemingly solipsistic commitment to "principle is in the mind" (152), Zhang Zai's conception of moral personhood, and Wang Yangming's idea of innate moral consciousness. In my opinion, it would be hard to find better Western theories for the same purposes. Therefore, I believe the book has been exceedingly successful in fulfilling the goal specified in its introduction: using a comparative approach drawing on Western analytic philosophy to "make these issues [of Neo-Confucianism] accessible to Western thinkers by shedding light on their universality through the analytic explication of these texts." (1)

Regarding her analyses of Neo-Confucian philosophers, one very strong case is made by Liu concerning Zhang Zai and Wang Fuzhi, two definitive figures in the school of qi (氣學, vital-energy): five of  the 12 chapters are dedicated to this topic. The presentation of these two philosophers spans all major aspects of their thought, and compares each with the other and with other lineages of thought in Neo-Confucianism. Given the limited resources on this school's thought in English scholarship, Liu's contribution deserves a special commendation.

As a Confucian scholar, I feel that there is no better way to celebrate Liu's great accomplishment than trying to contribute my own critical thinking about it, and thus helping to advance the already very inspiring conversation she has started. I will make three major points.

Firstly, Liu's interpretation of Zhou Dunyi's metaphysics needs to be reconsidered. A principle aim for Liu's interpretation of Zhou Dunyi's remarkably abstruse metaphysical thought, as with other interpretations of it in the Neo-Confucian tradition, is to show that it is a Confucian, rather than a Daoist, metaphysics. This implies that the world originates from something, rather than nothing, so that Confucianism's commitment to ethical realism can be ultimately grounded (69). I agree with Liu's adoption of this criterion, but disagree on its interpretive outcome.

One of the issues that has vexed interpreters of Zhou Dunyi for centuries is the relationship between "Wuji" and "Taiji." Through a careful textual analysis, Liu renders the starting stage, "Wuji," in Zhou Dunyi's cosmology, as "a primordial infinite chaos (of undifferentiated and unbounded qi)." This stage is followed by another one of "Taiji" (the supreme ultimate) understood as a gigantic space-time framework of whose movement and rest (yang and yin) give rise to concrete things in the world. (58) Liu concludes that "Zhou Dunyi's 'Wuji and Taiji' is a statement of cosmogony, not a statement of ontology" (59). Because Liu states clearly that what differentiates "cosmogony" from "ontology" (92) is that the latter is atemporal, we can safely conclude that according to Liu, the stages described by Zhou's cosmology, including Wuji, Taiji, Yin-Yang, five phases, four seasons, the myriad things and eventually human beings, have a temporal relationship of "cosmogonical succession" to each other, rather than the one of "ontological dependence," in an atemporal sense, which is emphasized by the Cheng-Zhu school of principle.

One major reason for me to challenge this view is that Liu's interpretation will, as she admits (59), cast Zhou's cosmology into a shape that is consistent with that of Laozi (traditionally identified as the founder of Daoism), and therefore, defy the very criterion she adopted to differentiate Zhou's metaphysics from Daoism. Liu agrees with the view defended by Yongtong Tang (44) that -- read in its original context rather than under the influence of the later commentary of Wang Bi -- the "wu" (formless) stage of Laozi's cosmology refers to a temporal beginning of the cosmos which is an "undifferentiated something" (42). In my view, this understanding of "wu" is Daoist because according to Laozi's advocacy of the principle "reversion is the action of Dao,"[1] what takes place earlier in the cosmic evolution of the Dao is more generative and powerful, and thus ethically more commendable. In this way, Laozi's cosmogonical commitment to an initial undifferentiated something supports his critique of Confucian humanistic values, since human society becomes sophisticated only when it develops after those primitive cosmic stages.

However, inspired by the ontological mode of thinking exemplified by earlier Confucian classics such as the Great Commentary of the Classic of Change, Neo-Confucianism advanced two major strategies to critique Laozi. For the Zhang-Wang school of vital-energy mentioned above, the beginning stage of the cosmos is not temporal, but an atemporal, ontological "original state" (本體) of harmony and equilibrium of qi which "contains the interaction and interchange between two opposite forces of yin and yang" (74). In this way, whatever transpires temporally earlier in the cosmic process is not more generative or ethically more authentic. Instead, Confucian humanistic values represent principles of human flourishing which can be justified because they are in sync with those principles of qi in its original state of harmony and equilibrium. A second strategy taken by the Cheng-Zhu school of principle is to affirm the ontological priority of li (principle) over qi (vital-energy), so that Confucian ethical realism, which focuses upon principles of human interaction, is even more straightforwardly espoused.

From these two approaches to the Confucian critique of Laozi's cosmology, we find that what differentiates a Confucian metaphysics from a Daoist is not exactly that the former envisions the origination of the world from something rather than nothing, but that the original state of the world is something to which orders and patterns are intrinsic, so that those Confucian humanistic values can be ultimately grounded in ontology. Unfortunately, according to Liu's interpretation, Zhou Dunyi does not subscribe to either approach. Compared with the formless something in Laozi's cosmogony, the identification of the fundamental feature of the initial Wuji stage as an infinite "chaos" will be no less favorable to the Daoist meta-ethical discourse which typically drifts away from those Confucian humanistic values. In my view, in order to furnish an interpretation of Zhou Dunyi's metaphysics that harmonizes with Zhou's Confucian moral philosophy, we need to remain close to those two traditional approaches.

Secondly, Liu categories the eight Neo-Confucian philosophers into three groups: the Cheng-Zhu school of principle, the Lu-Wang school of mind, and the Zhang-Wang school of vital-energy. Using the criterion of whether these lineages of thought provided satisfying answers to shared philosophical issues, Liu most favors the school of vital-energy and most disapproves of the school of principle. Although I appreciate the distinguished work that Liu has contributed to the research of the school of vital-energy, I retain my belief in the philosophical potential of the school of principle. In what follows, I will offer reflections on two major critiques by Liu of the thought of Zhu Xi, one of the leading thinkers in the school of principle.

Liu's chief criticism of Zhu Xi's metaphysics is that "Zhu Xi's dichotomy of principle (li) and vital-energy (qi) renders principle causally inert and ontologically irrelevant." (103) A similar charge was once raised by Cao Duan (1271-1368 CE), namely that li, if needing to rely upon the movement of qi to function, would be a "dead li."[2] Nevertheless, as Chen Lai argues,[3] Zhu Xi's thought on the relation between li and qi went through several stages. In my view, its first stage (when Zhu Xi meticulously annotated Zhou Dunyi's works) is a li-qi dualism by which Zhu considers li as patterns of the movement of qi, and thus not ontologically prior to qi. Its second stage (when Zhu Xi debated Lu Jiuyuan and his brother) is a li monism by which Zhu conceptualizes li as referring to the singular ontological principle, Taiji, which generates qi, and thus explains where the cosmos is ultimately from. I do agree that when Zhu Xi mixes these two distinctive meanings of li and uses the same term to discuss varying issues on his third stage of thought confusions arise; here Liu and Cao Duan's charge is legitimate. However, this does not mean that these confusions are necessary to the ontological approach that the Cheng-Zhu vision of Neo-Confucian metaphysics generally follows. If we take the term "li" to merely refer to patterns of qi, and take the name of "Taiji" to designate the singular ontological creative power that is thought of being able to generate the entire world, we will find a more coherent reading of Zhu Xi's metaphysics and appreciate that this is also a reasonable ontological approach. Although we do not have room here to propose a more detailed argument,[4] I do think that Zhu Xi's metaphysics can be interpreted in a more charitable way.

Another major critique by Liu of Zhu Xi's moral philosophy is that "His disparaging attitude on human emotion and desire turns his moral psychology into an anti-sentimentalist pronouncement" (137), and therefore, moral judgement according to Zhu Xi would lack motivation and "have no causal efficacy whatsoever." (242) This critique is based upon Liu's dualistic understanding of Zhu Xi's thought on the relationship between heavenly principle and human desire, which leads to her conclusion that "in general he [Zhu Xi] argues that human desire and heavenly principle are incompatible." (134) Again, we can find textual evidence to render a more charitable, less dualistic reading of Zhu Xi on this point. For example, Zhu Xi states that

the proportion of heavenly principle and human desire [within the human mind-heart] needs to be distinguished. Heavenly principle originally takes more weight, and even human desire is produced from heavenly principle. Despite calling it human desire, there is naturally heavenly principle within it.[5]

Regarding the role of sentiments in Zhu Xi's psychology, in "A Treatise on Humaneness," Zhu Xi says that

there are four virtues for the human mind-heart: humaneness, righteousness, ritual-propriety, and wisdom -- the virtue of humaneness embraces them all. When these virtues come forth and function, they are manifested in the human sentiments of love, obligation, respect, and judiciousness -- the sentiment of commiseration pervades them all.[6]

Clearly, Zhu Xi sees the incipient moral sentiments in Mencius' thought as the "manifestations" of human virtues, upon which our moral pursuit can rely. In this sense, we can hardly read him as making an "anti-sentimentalist pronouncement." Therefore, when Zhu Xi talks of the apparent confrontation between heavenly principle and human desire, we should think of what Zhu Xi means by "renyu" (human desire) in this context as mostly what he elsewhere calls "siyu" (selfish desire), rather than human desires in general.

This reflection on Liu's critique to Zhu Xi's moral philosophy leads to my third and final criticism. Similar to the "anti-sentimentalist" charge against Zhu Xi, Liu presents a number of clear-cut categorical judgements regarding Neo-Confucian philosophies. For instance, "the notion principle in Lu Xiangshan's discourse has a normative sense and signifies only moral principle" (141), and "Wang Yangming's moral theory is also a form of utopian ethical theory -- highly idealistic and implausible" (263). While reading these statements with suspicion, I was wondering whether the comparative approach that Liu took at the beginning of her research may lead her to prefer statements with clear-cut conceptual boundaries. It is quite understandable that conceptual precision and rigorous reasoning are values cherished by Western analytic philosophy. However, are these values cherished by Neo-Confucian philosophy in the same way? If so, we should not consider Liu's habit of analytic reasoning and its resulting hermeneutics of Neo-Confucian thoughts at all problematic. However, I wonder whether Liu's unequivocal judgements have left out something significant to the Neo-Confucian tradition.

Neo-Confucian thinkers generally differentiated two approaches to philosophical discourse: one addresses "the original state (of things)" (本體), and another focuses on "the cultivating effort (of human praxis)" (工夫). The former discourse shares a concern similar to analytic philosophy which devises precise concepts and systematic theories to tackle philosophical issues. However, the latter focuses on how to put those theorized and idealized states of things into practice. Because of this distinction, Neo-Confucian philosophers may intensely debate each other using the second sort of discourse, while enjoying basically the same conceptual understanding of the original state of things. This also implies that the apparent challenging of views among Neo-Confucian thinkers may be just tendential, rather than conceptual. In other words, some tendential differences may be crucial for shaping these thinkers' efforts at moral cultivation, but would not lead to any conceptual variation concerning their theoretical understanding of the world. For instance, Liu uses "pragmatist metaphysics" to differentiate the Lu-Wang school's metaphysics from the Cheng-Zhu's one, and summarizes that for the Lu-Wang school of mind, "the world's principle is set in the man-world interactions," while Cheng-Zhu's understanding of heavenly principle is formulated in a "transcendent system" (154). Nevertheless, there is plenty of textual evidence to corroborate the view that Cheng-Zhu's understanding of principle also focuses upon the man-world interactions, and we also find that the idea that the human mind-heart encompasses all principles can be equally applied to Zhu Xi's thought, as indicated by the above quote from Zhu's "A Treatise on Humaneness."

Since these two schools enjoy much more commonality conceptually than their debate shows, we should realize that some of those seemingly unresolvable Neo-Confucian disputes may take place in a form of philosophical discourse alternative to the conceptual and theoretical one. As a consequence, contemporary researchers of Neo-Confucian philosophers need to discern carefully whether a tendential difference among them leads to a conceptual one. This also requires that philosophers trained in the Western analytic tradition may need to avoid their habit of making­­ judgements with clear-cut conceptual boundaries in order to accommodate non-Western philosophies' disparate concerns.

In conclusion, if my review contributes some valuable critiques to Liu's work, that is because the book is already profound and inspiring enough to be a foundation for advanced scholarship. Moreover, I have only touched on a few of the many research trajectories that scholars can continue to work on, and hence, I do hope there will be continual discussions of this book in varying academic venues.

REFERENCES

Cao, Duan (2003). Cao Duan Ji (The Collected Work of Cao Duan). Beijing: Zhong Hua Shu Ju.

Chan, Wing-tsit (1963). A Source Book in Chinese Philosophy. Princeton University Press.

Chen, Lai (2000). Zhu Zi Zhe Xue Yan Jiu (A Study on Master Zhu's Philosophy). Press of Eastern China Normal University.

Song, Bin (2018). A Study of Comparative Philosophy of Religion on "Creatio Ex Nihilo" and "Sheng Sheng" (Birth Birth, 生生). Dissertation. Boston University.

Zhu, Xi (2002). Zhu Zi Quan Shu (The Complete Work of Zhu Xi). 27 volumes. Shanghai: Gu Ji Chu Ban She.