On Female Body Experience collects eight essays by Iris Marion Young that span twenty-seven years of feminist theorizing of embodiment. All but the introduction and one of the essays, “Menstrual Meditations,” have been published elsewhere. This worthwhile collection includes some now famous works, in particular the essay mentioned in the subtitle of the book, “Throwing Like a Girl.” Many of the essays in this collection have stood the test of time. They have been read, criticized and applauded, commented on and taught in multiple venues and to different audiences over the years. Some—including “Throwing Like a Girl,” “Pregnant Embodiment,” “Women Recovering Our Clothes,” and “Breasted Experience”—were sometimes difficult to obtain since the book in which they were initially collected was out-of-print for some time.[1] Both teachers and students of feminist philosophy and phenomenology will be happy to see them in this new collection. Accessibility, however, is not the only merit of this new book, for this collection holds a great deal of interest in its own right. Not only does it group together essays representative of Young’s on-going thinking about female embodiment and her engagement with phenomenological and feminist philosophers over the span of her career—thus of interest to scholars—this collection also provides a thematically cohesive work that can be read as an introduction to questions of lived bodily experience from a feminist perspective, hence representing a valuable resource for teaching.
“Women Recovering Our Clothes” is one essay where Young applies this Irigarayan approach (cf. pp. 10-11). There, Young seeks to speak female desires and pleasures that find expression in the context of clothing and that escape subsumption to a masculinist imaginary. Young hence locates the pleasure she describes beyond the feminist critique of women’s pleasure in clothing as the product of an internalized, voyeuristic and fetishizing, gaze of masculinist culture. Although I am generally sympathetic to this project of attempting to speak women’s desires and cultures in positive terms, I find its formulation in this essay problematic. Young is careful to note that she “can claim to speak only for the experience of women like [herself]”, that is, white, Western, middle-class, heterosexual, professional women in late capitalist society (p. 69). Yet the account of clothing presented seems to idealize (even romanticize) the experience of clothing of these women, to the point of forgetting its divergent and privileged status with respect to the experiences of other women. To say that “I do not possess my clothes; I live with them.” (p. 71) is to forget the material conditions that allow me to possess them. And to take the fantasy opened up by clothing in consumer culture to be enabling of an active subjectivity and freedom (p.73) is to forget that we have this freedom to play with clothes only because it is in the interests of this culture to allow a defined space of imaginary freedom in lieu of real freedoms that it bars us from imagining.[3]
To Young’s credit, she is clearly aware of the ways in which the “aesthetic freedom” that Western middle-class women take in their clothing is embedded in patriarchal consumer capitalism and in exploitative and imperialist projects with respect to other cultures (p. 74). But if part of the motivation for expressing women’s experience and desires is to generate political solidarity between women, then more attention needs to be paid to how certain experiences are idealized to the exclusion of others.[4] This becomes important when the idealized (Western, middle-class, etc.) experience is identified as providing a certain freedom for women (albeit aesthetic or imaginative). The danger is, then, that this modality of freedom becomes presented as normative for all women. This is clearly not Young’s project; rather it represents a way in which feminist projects can, and often are, co-opted by patriarchal, imperialist forces. One can imagine the slogan: to be free, other women need to be able to express themselves in their clothes, as Western women are allowed to do. What is forgotten is how much Western female clothing—as with all clothing—is about disciplining bodies, quantifying and measuring them, and habituating them to the norms of the culture (in this case, capitalist consumer culture).
In contrast to the idealizing account of “Women Recovering Our Clothes,” I would locate Young’s most recent essay “Menstrual Meditations.” Young is cautious in this essay to note that her project is not one of recuperating a pure female core experience. Indeed, she finds, underneath the social oppression of women as menstruators, “not a glorious experience, but rather a personal bodily process that causes many women some discomfort or annoyance some of the time … [that] nevertheless carries emotional meaning for many women.” (p. 98) The essay is then, for the most part, critical—pointing to the social structures that force women to keep menstruation hidden, even while claiming to treat them as equals. What becomes clear is that women are considered equal and full subjects only if they discipline themselves to be like the “normal,” masculine, seemingly solid and in-control self, i.e., to hide any reference to menstruation. Menstruation, Young concludes, is negatively overdetermined—hence the difficulty of locating a common experience to be revalued. Yet Young’s account is not exclusively negative. In the final pages of the essay, she gestures not to generalizations or idealizations about menstruation, but rather towards possibilities that “the experience offers that some of us take up some of the time.” (p. 119) Through a reflection on mood and temporality, Young teases out some of the meaningful, affective possibilities of menstruation as a recurring bodily experience that is marginalized by one’s culture (p. 121). This is not a romantic account of our freedom in what she calls “the menstrual closet.” It is from its devalued location in our culture that menstruation becomes the possible source for meaning, affection and self-reflection. In listing the essays where she employs her Irigarayan strategy of revaluing female experience, Young does not include this essay (cf. Introduction, pp. 10-11). Yet the ontology of menstrual moods presented here reminds this reader of Irigaray. For in opening up possibilities that were unthinkable within dominant culture, this essay, I believe, performs in exemplary fashion the positive function Young seeks. In this sense, menstruation does not appear as a site for celebration or glorification of female identity, but is redefined as a possible site for resistance and the creation of alternative meanings. Since it offers no single, definitive account of menstrual experience, “Menstrual Meditations” opens the way for readers to carry its reflections further and, I find, is highly promising as a result.
On Female Body Experience is a rich and thought-provoking work that addresses themes often overlooked, even in feminist writings. Its value consists not only in its attention to the theme of female embodiment, but also in the particular aspects of embodiment chosen and in the care and detail of its analyses. It offers new ways of thinking about lived bodies and opens new avenues of investigation in feminist phenomenology and ontology.
[1] Iris Marion Young, Throwing Like a Girl and Other Essays in Feminist Philosophy and Social Theory (Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1990).
[2] Iris Marion Young, “‘Throwing Like a Girl’: Twenty Years Later” in Body and Flesh: A Philosophical Reader, ed. Donn Welton (Oxford: Blackwell Publishers Ltd., 1998).
[3] I realize that Young’s point here is that once a realm of free imagination is opened up, other possibilities will present themselves (p. 74). But, in my view, this imaginary sphere will always be circumscribed by the consumer culture and fashion industry that enables it; the only actualization that we will then be permitted is that of buying different clothes.