The Bloomsbury Research Handbook of Chinese Philosophy Methodologies

This 18-chapter anthology is potentially of interest to at least three distinct audiences: philosophers and other scholars whose primary focus is not Chinese philosophy, undergraduate and graduate students who aspire to become specialists in Chinese philosophy, and scholars who are already established specialists in Chinese philosophy. My review will be organized around what the volume offers and how well it serves each of these potential audiences.

In my experience, some philosophers and other scholars who have no familiarity with the Chinese tradition are hesitant to study or even discuss it, because they worry that the subject requires some methodology so different from their own that anything they might say would be horribly misguided, and the "entry costs" for acquiring the appropriate methodology are so high in terms of the time and effort required that it is not practically feasible for them to achieve even a rudimentary conversational competence in the area. One strength of Sor-hoon Tan's anthology is that it can help assuage such worries, for it conveniently collects such a wide variety of approaches that, almost regardless of your own orientation, you can find someone in the volume advocating or applying a kindred methodology to the Chinese materials. Yiu-ming Fung will speak to analytic philosophers, David Jones to continentalists, Roger T. Ames to process philosophers, Tan to pragmatists, Eva Kit Wah Man to feminists, Franklin Perkins to metaphysicians, Hagop Sarkissian and Ryan Nichols to experimental philosophers, and Peimin Ni to those who approach philosophy as a "way of life" focused on personal self-improvement. The list could go on, and the above descriptions are not meant to capture everything of interest in the chapters just mentioned.

On the other hand, not all the chapters will be equally accessible to those completely unfamiliar with the Chinese tradition. Perkins's contribution may well be the most accessible to neophytes. Ames's may be the least so (perhaps because portions of it were previously published in a specialized journal). The rest of the essays fall somewhere in between, though I think most of them will be largely intelligible to newcomers. Some disparity among the contributions on this score is perhaps unavoidable in an anthology of this size, especially if -- as seems to be the case with this book -- addressing readers outside the field was not a major priority for the project. Still, the unevenness of accessibility constitutes something of a missed opportunity, since pretty much all the authors clearly favor greater engagement with Chinese philosophy by scholars who currently have no such involvement.

For non-specialists in Chinese philosophy, the volume may hold interest for scholars who are interested in methodology per se, apart from its application to the Chinese tradition in particular. The chapters already mentioned demonstrate that specialists have advocated and applied a variety of methodologies to the Chinese materials, which itself may be noteworthy for those whose meta-methodological considerations have not previously extended to non-Western materials. Moreover, some essays seek to articulate methodologies that, in trying to do justice to the Chinese tradition, are not (at least as presented) identified with any particular Western philosophical orientation, and which operate at a fairly abstract level and might potentially be applied fruitfully to the study of Western philosophy. For example, Kwong-loi Shun advocates a three-stage approach for studying Chinese philosophy, which he divides into (i) a step of "textual analysis" that hews closely to the ideas and aims of a past thinker and strives "to minimize the influence of our present perspective and conceptions" (67), (ii) a process of "articulation" that "seeks to draw out the relevance of the thinker's ideas to us in the present" (68), and (iii) a process of "philosophical construction" that seeks "to build a reflective and systematic account that we, from our present perspective, regard as appealing" (69). Likewise, Bo Mou outlines a "constructive-engagement strategy" that he explicitly says "is not limited to studies of Chinese philosophy" (199). More provocatively, Leigh Jenco advocates applying methodologies developed within the Chinese tradition to a variety of fields outside the study of Chinese philosophy, in part on the ground that "without using or at least becoming open to Chinese methods, we cannot avoid reproducing the power relationships that dictate only Western forms of knowledge are legitimate, 'real' knowledge" (282). As before, these chapters will not all be equally accessible to those with no familiarity with the Chinese tradition.

Undergraduates and graduate students aspiring to become specialists in Chinese philosophy are explicitly identified as an intended audience on the back cover, which casts the volume as a "contribution to the education of the next generation of Chinese philosophers," where "Chinese philosophers" is intended as a label for "anyone who conducts research in Chinese philosophy, regardless of their ethnicity or geographical location" (8).[1] For future "Chinese philosophers," the book is useful simply in virtue of collecting in one place discussions of methodology, so students can get a clear sense of some of the issues that are commonly debated by scholars. To what extent does Chinese thought qualify as "philosophy" in the first place? Is the application of Western methodologies to Chinese materials necessarily distorting? When encountering ambiguous evidence in the Chinese sources, should one's guiding presumption be that their views are different from predominant ones in the West, unless proven similar, or should one's guiding presumption be that their views are similar, unless proven different? What are the benefits and perils of more purely historical readings versus more purely philosophical readings? Is Chinese philosophy something that one may grasp through bookish study, or is it something that one must also practice in some sense? Apart from the discussions of such questions that are spread across the individual chapters, Tan's Introduction does a commendable job in offering an overview of the relevant issues.

The volume also has three chapters that do not fit easily into any particular categorization, but will be of interest to aspiring "Chinese philosophers." In the first, Ronnie Littlejohn gives a very thoughtful and nuanced discussion of what it might mean to "let a text speak for itself." His chapter is not only replete with useful observations, but also nicely serves as a model for how even methodological slogans may require unpacking and interpretation. I find especially helpful his suggestion that in philosophizing with a classical Chinese text, the text "should provide resistance, guidance, and correction, just as the creation of understanding between speaker and hearer occurs in everyday discourse" (87). In the second such chapter, Lisa Raphals argues that "an exclusive focus on Confucianism as the dominant paradigm of Chinese philosophy and culture is destructive . . . because it obscures, to the point of elimination, [certain] fundamentally important elements of Chinese culture and history" (307). Her essay serves to highlight potential biases in the training that students may receive, and warns against any methodology that would privilege one tradition of Chinese thought over all others. By the same token, Raphals's discussion of scientific thinking and military strategy helpfully highlight other aspects of the Chinese tradition that have claim to consideration as part of "Chinese philosophy." The third such chapter, by Sarah Mattice, unlike the other contributions, focuses on pedagogy. Especially for graduate students looking to develop their own approaches to teaching the Chinese materials, Mattice offers a number of helpful reflections and techniques. (Seasoned instructors may perhaps find some new methods to consider adding to their repertoire.)

Since students on the path to becoming "Chinese philosophers" will probably already have some familiarity with figures and ideas from the Chinese tradition, the worries noted earlier about accessibility are less likely to be a problem for them. However, I must register a number of concerns about the usefulness of the volume as a handbook for them. First, the high cost of the book means that fewer students are likely to buy a copy, so the publisher's pricing is antithetical to one of the book's aims.

Second, some of the methodologies on offer are not the sort that undergraduate or graduate students could easily engage on their own. For example, among the more innovative approaches are those proposed by Edward Slingerland and by Sarkissian and Nichols. Slingerland's method involves study of the corpus of Chinese texts through "large-scale random sampling of data, coding or analysis by independent researchers, checks of intercoder reliability, and statistical analysis in order to evaluate the significance of any discerned trends" (328). The experimental method proposed by Sarkissian and Nichols involves designing and administering surveys to groups of people large enough to constitute a good sample size. Both methods are better suited to researchers working in teams that bring together researchers with different strengths, especially since the statistical expertise required for proper analysis of the data is not the kind of training most Chinese and Philosophy departments offer. For undergraduate or graduate students who have no opportunity to join such a team, such methods may simply be out of reach.

Third, there are other practical obstacles that would make it difficult for students to adopt some of the methods described. Undergraduates attracted to a particular methodology offered might seek to pursue graduate studies with the author(s) of the chapter(s) in question, but some of those authors are at institutions that lack graduate programs, though perhaps those authors might be willing and able to serve as outside members of a thesis committee. Graduate students, on the other hand, who are attracted to a methodology but whose advisors might be opposed to that methodology, or at least unwilling to direct a thesis using it, will likewise face difficulties. Even if neither of those problems apply, there may be other institutional obstacles. For instance, Alexus McLeod defends the value of doing Chinese-Indian comparative philosophy. After noting that most sinologists are expected to learn Classical Chinese, Japanese, and French, he adds, "Anyone who has the time and ability to learn Classical Chinese, Japanese, and French has the time and ability to learn . . . Sanskrit" (303n4). Even if that claim is true, not all institutions offer advanced courses in Sanskrit, so achieving the requisite skills to pursue this methodology (at least at a high level) may not be easy.

Fourth, even among those methodologies that consist mostly in particular approaches to reading Chinese texts, in a number of cases (e.g., Shun and Mou) the presentation of those methodologies is (perhaps due to space constraints) more an overview than a careful, step-by-step demonstration. As a result, students wanting to understand better how the methodology actually works in practice will need to read other works by the author(s) in question. Such extra reading is advisable for students anyway -- anyone intending to become a specialist will ultimately need to have broad familiarity with the work of many other experts in the field -- but this feature means that, in terms of exposing students to various methodologies, the book provides only a first step in some cases, rather than a thorough introduction.

In light of the preceding points, my assessment is that although the handbook does have something useful to offer aspiring specialists in Chinese philosophy, it is far from being a straightforward "how to" manual. Instead, it is perhaps best taken as a guide to "how might" one study Chinese philosophy, where students may get a sense of methodologies to which they have not previously been exposed, and where they will find theoretical reflections on both those methodologies and those which they have already encountered in their reading of the secondary literature.

Finally, I turn to what the volume has to offer specialists in Chinese philosophy. From a specialist's perspective, despite its large size the volume actually has rather limited coverage: it is confined almost exclusively to Anglophone studies of Chinese philosophy. In her editor's introduction, Tan is explicit in acknowledging this limitation and disowning any claim to comprehensiveness (30-31). One cannot blame her for this choice of focus, since if one were to try genuinely to cover all the methods that have been used to study Chinese philosophy, the volume would have to be many times longer. Still, I think it worth noting a few of the subjects that get no more than passing mention. For one thing, the Chinese themselves have a long history of studying Chinese philosophy reflected, for example, in the commentarial tradition. The methodology of Chinese commentators has been the subject of English studies by John Makeham, Daniel Gardner, and John B. Henderson, among others. A number of chapters mention the Chinese commentarial tradition, though none focus on it. Beyond the Chinese, the Japanese and Koreans also have centuries-long traditions of studying and commenting on Chinese philosophy. These traditions get some notice in Ming-Huei Lee's chapter, but only briefly. Modern European scholars have also produced substantial bodies of work on Chinese philosophy, and thus would also merit consideration in any more comprehensive review of methodologies. In addition, while most of the chapters are concerned with classical Chinese philosophical works, insofar as one might identify (at least some) later Daoist and Buddhist writings as forms of Chinese philosophy, then Daoist and Buddhist scholars studying and commenting on earlier Chinese texts, and subsequent work by other scholars writing in a variety of languages on later Daoism and Buddhism, would also deserve representation in a more comprehensive survey. Again, while I do not think the book should be faulted for not covering all these other topics, it does mean that specialists interested in the fullest range of Chinese philosophy methodologies, either for their own edification or for the sake of training their students, will need to supplement this book.

As to the Anglophone methodologies Tan does include, even though she does not claim to be quite comprehensive on that front, she does succeed in collecting a fairly balanced and representative sample of different approaches. Being a specialist in Chinese philosophy myself, I already knew something of almost all the methodologies being proposed (and I suspect many other specialists would be in the same position), so what was most instructive to me were those moments where the authors criticize or express reservations about the methodologies of other scholars, especially those of other authors in the volume. For example, Perkins criticizes earlier work by Slingerland. Slingerland criticizes the work of Ames and is joined in this criticism of Ames by Fung. Fung also criticizes methodologies that attempt to be more strictly historicist, with the famous scholar Hu Shi as his primary target. The overarching theme of Lee's chapter is a similar criticism, but aimed instead at the contemporary historian Yu Yingshi. Likewise, Littlejohn responds to certain worries raised by contemporary sinologists and historians about philosophical approaches to early Chinese texts. On the other hand, Michael Nylan criticizes (without naming names) specialists in Chinese philosophy for failing to take adequate account of the findings of specialists in Chinese history, though she herself is not opposed to philosophical studies of the Chinese tradition.

While these critical aspects of the essays are likely to be of interest to specialists, I would have liked to have seen more responses from the contributors to each other. For example, Ames does not respond to any of the criticisms of his methodology; perhaps the closest thing to a response that one gets is a brief discussion offered on Ames's behalf in Littlejohn's chapter. Likewise, it would have been interesting to hear Nylan's response to what Littlejohn says about what philosophers should make of the fact that many early Chinese texts are now thought to be multi-author compilations that came together over long periods of time, since Nylan castigates (some) philosophers for neglecting precisely this fact. Perkins does not indicate whether his criticism of Slingerland applies equally to Slingerland's essay in this volume, and Slingerland does not address Perkins' critique of his earlier work. Perhaps the contributors did not all have the opportunity to read each other's chapters prior to publication, or perhaps they did but for one reason or another did not or could not modify their chapters to create more dialogue among themselves, but either way I find it a pity that there is not more back-and-forth between them.

This last point brings me to a final observation about the value of the volume for current specialists in Chinese philosophy. Although some scholars do significantly alter their methodologies over the course of their academic lives (among the contributors, Slingerland is an example, if one compares his PhD thesis with his current approach), such shifts are not common, as far as I can tell. I therefore confess to being somewhat pessimistic about whether the criticisms made in the volume will have much impact on specialists, or whether any of them will genuinely be tempted to adopt in whole or part methodologies described in the volume that are not already largely in agreement with their own. Perhaps the volume might encourage some specialists to be more open-minded in their views of the methodologies that are not already their own, but if so, that is not a difference that will likely be reflected in a big change in their research. Arguably, these worries could apply to almost any anthology about methodologies (at least in the humanities), so in that regard the limitation is not peculiar to this book. Nevertheless, it does suggest that -- like other such anthologies -- the value of the handbook for specialists in Chinese philosophy would then be more as a pedagogical tool than as a research aid -- it is a resource to which one can point students for examples of certain (misguided or plausible) methodological positions and (misguided or plausible) criticisms of them. That is indeed a valuable feature, though probably not enough to justify it as a crucial volume that all specialists should have on their shelves.