Democracy in international relations is the Achilles heel of democratic theory. Over the years Jürgen Habermas has increasingly addressed this problem and has envisaged a multilevel global constitutional system to deal with the conundrum.
In the present book he reconstructs the basis for the legitimacy of a democratic European Union (EU), an entity that while not a state is still more than an international organization. The EU does not fit with the conventional categories of public and international law. The immediate backdrop for the book is the financial crisis and how the "troika" -- the International Monetary Fund, the European Commission and the European Central Bank (ECB) -- has handled the problems of the Eurozone. In its struggle with global financial markets the EU has lapsed into old-fashioned power politics and dictated conditions for the insolvent members of the zone. An appendix reprints some of Habermas' recent political interventions, where he accuses Europe's political leaders of inapt action and putting the whole integration project at risk.
The main part of the book is an essay on a constitution for Europe. A shorter essay entitled "The concept of human dignity" is also included. One may wonder why, since it deals with the concept of human dignity in the genealogy of human rights in the modern era. Human dignity only found its way into international law and national constitutions after the Second World War. Habermas makes the case for a conceptual connection between human dignity and human rights. The former is not merely an empty placeholder, but constitutes the moral source of human rights. Dignity which has its origin in status hierarchies and social honor has been universalized -- all people possess it equally. Habermas' hypothesis is that human dignity serves as a conceptual hinge in establishing the connection between rational morality and positive law. Historically, human dignity performed a mediating function in shifting the perspective from plain moral duties to legal claims backed by the sanctioning power of positive law.
Through establishing an internal connection between human dignity and human rights Habermas can forcefully counter a minimalist -- or deflationary -- reading of human rights. The latter reading disconnects human rights from human dignity as their justificatory source, and tailors it to international politics, viz., as normative reasons for legitimate intervention. For Habermas the moral source of human rights is human dignity -- equal worth and respect for each person -- which can only be cashed out as membership in a self-governing polity. Democracy is a claim of human rights. Human rights differ from plain moral rights since they require institutionalization and hence a democratic procedure for validation. The hinging function of human dignity may fill a conceptual gap, but the institutional one persists. While human rights are universal and refer to humanity as such, democracy is confined to a particular community of legal consociates who come together to make binding collective decisions. The cosmopolitan condition, which requires the constitutionalization of international law, cannot draw its legitimacy from the international law regime itself or from the putative validity of humanitarian norms. Dignity protecting human rights is a context- transcending principle in search of its proper institutionalization. Can there then be political orders beyond the nation state that can resolve the tension between democracy and human rights? From this perspective the EU presents itself as an important contribution to the constitutionalization of a world society. Hence, this essay deserves its place in the book but should have been placed prior to the main one as it is in the German edition.
How can the citizens of Europe come to see themselves as the authors of the laws they are to live by in the multilevel constellation that makes up the EU? This is the question under examination in the main chapter entitled '"The Crisis of the European Union in Light of a Constitutionalisation of International Law".
In earlier works Habermas has defended the thesis that a world government -- a world state -- is neither desirable nor feasible. International law is not a solution to the problem of order -- to overcome the 'state of nature' through the constitutionalization and democratization of an authoritarian system of dominance -- but to a coordination problem among already constitutionalized political orders. Is democracy then possible at the European level? Or is it true that without the "enabling condition of sovereignty" -- with "some form of law, with the centralized authority to determine the rules and a centralized monopoly of power of enforcement" -- there can be no justice as Thomas Nagel claims (The Problem of Global Justice, 2005, 116)? Nagel follows Rawls, whose political conception of justice is fully associative. For Rawls norms of justice stem from the distinctive relations that people have towards each other in the obligatory and coercive frame of reference of a state. The state is a trigger of equal concern and respect. Outside the state the conditions for justice do not apply. Rawls' conception of an ideal just world is one of internally just states.
Habermas has, in line with Hauke Brunkhorst, opted for the uncoupling of state and democracy, seeing democracy as compatible with many forms of institutional arrangements and not necessarily dependent on the enabling condition of state sovereignty. A true republic presupposes democracy, but democracy does not presuppose the state. Constitution and democracy are not legally tied to the state.
In the present work, Habermas attacks the prevailing conflation of popular sovereignty and state sovereignty, which he sees as due to a collectivist misunderstanding. State sovereignty has to do with "Willkür" -- freedom of action guaranteed by classical international law -- which is necessary for outward action. This is clearly different from autonomy under the "laws of freedom" (Kant) which the citizens enjoy as members of a self-legislative body. Popular sovereignty implies that the political exercise of power has the character of being a process where the citizens themselves are the legislators, either directly or through their representatives. There is a connection between the two types of sovereignty, as state sovereignty comprises capabilities necessary for protecting the citizens' freedom and security and for realizing political goals. However, they refer to different entities (the citizens and the state) and to different functions (popular will formation and collective action). This means that constraining state sovereignty need not imply the constraining of popular sovereignty. Surrendering or pooling state sovereignty may be needed to facilitate supranational cooperation and problem-solving, but does not imply disenfranchisement in so far as it leaves the democratic procedure intact. As far as the nation states continue to uphold their constitutional role as guarantors of law and freedom, there is no loss of legitimacy involved in establishing a political order beyond the nation state. The normative meaning of democracy implies that political capabilities are extended beyond national borders when this is needed for controlling the political agenda. Hence the importance of the EU, which is truly a law-based system premised on a set of fundamental principles. But a distinctive trait of the European integration process is that it takes place among already legally domesticated and constitutionalized states.
According to Habermas, the EU's basic 'constitutional' order represents two major innovations in the process of pacifying the state of nature between states. First, supremacy of EU law is granted in the areas in which it has competences. However, the binding effect of EU law is neither grounded in the monopoly of violence at the European level nor in the final decision-making authority of the EU. The EU does not have the competence to increase its own competences and does not possess coercive means. No European army, prison or police exist. The European community is in fact disengaged from the organisational powers of the member states, which retain the monopoly of power and are the main implementing agencies of EU regulations. An autonomous legal level, not backed by the instruments of power, is established. The willingness to comply is simply presupposed. Compliance can be expected; first, because of the initial voluntary authorization of European integration in the establishment of the Coal and Steel Union, and secondly, because citizens' representatives are involved in the decision-making procedures through which EU law is made.
The second innovation has to do with the sharing of the constitution-making power between the citizens and the states (the European peoples). The EU is a union of states and of citizens -- as epitomized by the role of the Council and the directly elected European Parliament, representing the states and the citizens respectively. The treaties speak of the peoples of the member states and of the citizens of the Union. It is not "We, the People of the United Europe", but we, the citizens of Europe -- members of a state and of the Union. Drawing on the work of younger legal scholars, Habermas claims, that two constitution-making subjects have been cooperating in establishing a supranational order but the individual citizen constitutes the sole source of its legitimation. The citizens are called upon to take part in the European opinion- and will-formation process in two roles at the same time: as citizens of a member state and as Union citizens. That they are addressed in precisely these two roles is what a pouvoir constituant mixte means today. When the individuals are the source of legitimation for the EU, it is not necessary to settle once and for all who has the final decision-making authority: the EU or the member states. To be subordinate to supranational (democratically enacted) law is not to be arbitrarily dominated by supranational power. Joint European rule entails the capacity to co-determine the exercise of authority.
By this move Habermas contributes to the much debated issue of who has the final power of arbitration. Due to a shared sovereignty and common constitutional traditions of European states, the question is not which level possesses the final decision making authority, but rather whether the ruling complies with the law; whether the common legal norms are applied in a correct manner. It is only in determining application that the EU enjoys primacy, not in determining validity. The EU should not enjoy kompetenz-kompetenz -- it should not be authorized to amend its own competencies and should not be the final arbitrator of law. The multilevel legal order in Europe, with national courts and the ECB (and in some cases also the European Court of Human Rights) sharing jurisdictional power, ensures in principle the judicial monitoring of laws, the ability to handle "conflicts of law", and, one may add, to reach conclusions in hard cases within a time limit.
Through these innovations Habermas sees a way to establish the basis of legitimacy for a political order above the nation state, which leaves the democratic chain of rule intact. This order is not superimposed upon already constitutionalised orders, but rather is an order that emanates from the common European constitutional traditions and lives off them. The conception of originally shared popular sovereignty precludes the possibility of a superimposed sovereign. It is not a question of two levels competing for control over centralized authority, but rather of the interweaving and cooperation of the levels.
When embedded in such a legally regulated sphere, we could, I submit, conceive the state not as a dichotomous variable but in terms of degrees of stateness -- on a continuum with the autarchic state and the world society as end points. Means of coercion for protecting rights and realizing collective goals would be shared between levels. Within such a framework, the EU could claim legitimacy for its decisions by reference to the legal form they are dressed in, rather than with reference to some form of primordial collective identity.
Even though these innovations are reconstructions based on the EU's constitutional treaties, they are by no means seen as realized, by Habermas. The way the union is organized, with a free-floating Commission; the in-between status of the Council -- as a law-maker and an executive; the weakness of the EP and lack of Europeanised party systems, and other institutional imperfections makes clear that the EU is only partly democratized.
My problem with this reconstruction of a legitimacy basis of the EU has to do with the lack of unifying elements. How can the members of such a union, which gives the constituent parts such a prominent role, come to see themselves as belonging to the same citizenry with obligations for one another?
Habermas, who is often thought of as a federalist, has persistently opted for a European Union of nation states. In the current book he also praises the European nation states as representing lasting achievements, not to be overcome. The EU should not be seen as an imperfect federal republic. The nation state is the biggest known locus of solidarity that the EU should continue to foster and enlarge beyond its borders. The EU is seen as the continuation of the democratic project of taming and civilising state power. Thus, European democracy cannot be disassociated from its nation-state foundation.
On the one hand Habermas is right in envisaging a stateless European Union as the EU emerged as a response to the problem of nationalism and of international relations in which no higher authority that controls the internal affairs of the nation states exists. A stateless entity beyond the nation state would be the answer to the claim that one should not replicate at the supranational level what went wrong at the national level, and which created the need for supranational organizations in the first place.
On the other hand, one may question Habermas' weak supranationalism -- the nation states are essentially left unaltered in this reconstruction. How can the collective identity of democratic political communities be extended beyond the borders of existing nation states, when what is required now is merely the opening of national publics to each other? Questions arise also because democracy requires that the citizens, when their rights have been infringed, can bring their grievances before a capable superior authority. The lack of supremacy for European law weakens the EU's capability to act and to constrain its members. Lack of action is today part of EU's legitimacy problems.
Moreover, for an order to achieve stability and legitimacy, agreement on the basic structure, and the polity structure that corresponds to it, is required. Systems of domination require justification with regard to the relevant characteristics of the political community to be regulated, as well as with regard to the purposes and interests to be realized. In what capacity are Europeans equals? When norms of justice not only stem from the distinctive relations that people have towards each other in the obligatory and coercive frame of reference of a state, when the EU asks the individuals to see themselves as European and not merely national citizens, what could amount to a trigger of equal concern and respect? The weakness of this reconstruction of a legitimate EU is that the requisite unifying component of the European political order is lacking. What are the constitutive norms -- the common European weal that expresses the distinctive relations of European citizens -- and what could be the basis for solidarity among Europeans?
This book is a vital contribution to the political theory of the multi-level constellation that makes up the EU. The EU is a polity in its own right which has a global-steering function. It possesses higher-level political decision-making capabilities, but possesses neither a collective identity nor the coercive instruments of a state. We are witnessing a federation without a state, but can it be cohesive and effective without the supranational competence to override the nation-state, to constrain as well as enlarge national mentalities; and can it be legitimate without a "we-feeling" and a sense of finalité that can provide the necessary foundation for collective European decision-making? In short, what could be the functional equivalent of a state in a non-state polity?