Derrick Darby’s urgent and important book, A Realistic Blacktopia, raises to the surface of conversations about race a question that too often remains only implicit within them, namely, that of the role played by consciousness in producing the material circumstances of racial inequality. Where Marxist and other materialist analyses are frequently accused of “class reductionism” that obscures the specific role of racist ideas, attitudes, feelings, and theories in producing the racist oppression of Black people and other people of color, the Critical Race Theory tradition has countered this perceived tendency by emphasizing the role of white racial identity and of the “psychological wage” people of European descent can be said to draw in exchange for upholding anti-Black racism. This emphasis on white identity and racist ideas has often been seen as a corrective to class-based analyses of anti-Black racism, which address white supremacy primarily as a product of capitalist economic relations, rather than as a system distinct and potentially separate from capitalism, and within which consciousness is itself primary in producing hierarchies of racial oppression.
But this perspective poses a problem for the project of anti-racism: if white supremacist consciousness truly benefits all white people who hold it, then white people stand to lose quite a lot by dismantling it. Unlike the Marxist analyses which typically hold that white supremacy is a strategy of capitalist domination over both white and Black workers who share a material interest in fighting racism, the CRT analyses tend to have it that from the point of view of white workers, the fight against racism is a sacrifice of self-interest. This sacrifice might well be called for from the point of view of moral duty. But since we know that people are unlikely to disavow that which benefits them, however much they might be morally obligated to do so, this situation would bode ill for the project of fighting white supremacy.
Darby’s central argument in A Realistic Blacktopia proceeds from this set of observations and approaches the anti-racist struggle from a perspective informed by the CRT approach—namely, as a moral duty which comes at a cost to whites, all of whom benefit from anti-Black racism. Focusing his discussion on the contours of race-consciousness among whites in the United States, Darby gives special consideration to the idea of “postracialism”—the view that while the United States might have imposed racial subjection upon Blacks in the past, no such inequality exists in the present.
The idea of postracialism, Darby argues, is remarkably impervious to empirical data showing that Blacks experience widespread racial oppression in the here and now. To make sense of this imperviousness, Darby adapts legal scholar Derrick Bell’s racial-realist, “hard-eyed view” on racist consciousness as an objective feature of social reality, a circumstance to which advocates of racial progress must tailor their strategies. Anti-racist strategy, Darby points out (following Bell), would have to contend with the incentives inclining white people to oppose anti-racist measures, as well as the fact that much empirical data on racial inequality is equally compatible both with the explanation that Black people are systematically discriminated against and with the explanation that Blacks simply make worse choices than white Americans do. This latter explanation would preserve postracialism, absolve whites of responsibility for the diminished life chances of Blacks, and encourage the conclusion that Black people bear most, if not sole, responsibility for ending racial inequality. Heaping piles of empirical data demonstrating Blacks’ worse social position, Darby argues, is therefore a nonstarter when it comes to motivating whites to address racial injustice, since the empirical data documenting unequal outcomes is compatible with there being no such injustice at all.
Darby identifies three tenets of postracialism. These are:
1: affirmation of the inclusive nature of the American ideals of freedom and equality;
2: affirmation that the greatest legacy of the Civil Rights Movement—understood from a King-centric perspective—was extending the scope of these ideals to previously excluded blacks, which resulted in a single ‘race’ of Americans, blending whites and blacks into a common nationality; and
3: affirmation that the creation of a ‘single’ and ‘racially integrated’ America has rendered the need for further government intervention on behalf of blacks, in particular, unnecessary and, moreover, that further intervention would not only be unfair and unconstitutional when secured at the expense of non-minorities but would also be detrimental to further black progress against persistent racial inequalities (19).
Darby argues, for example, that the problem is especially profound in debates about reparations for slavery that center on the question of how slavery produced long-term negative impacts for the descendants of enslaved Africans. Identifying “root causes,” Darby points out, is a notoriously difficult enterprise and it is much harder than it might at first appear to make the case that slavery is the “root cause” of Blacks’ lower social position today. Whites who choose to resist this analysis can easily do so, and not without significant support from social scientific data. What’s more, social science tells us that whites are simply unlikely to accept the claim, regardless of the amount of empirical data supporting it. For these reasons and others, Darby argues, instead of attempting from the start to refute the idea of postracialism, we should instead approach its prevalence as simply one of the objective facts about our situation with which we must contend. It cannot be dislodged simply by more and better ideas; social science research gives us reason to be highly pessimistic about whether whites will surmount the psychological barriers to understanding the continuing reality of racism and critical race theory itself supplies a compelling explanation for why they might not be motivated to try.
Darby is far more focused on figuring out what is going to work to undo racial oppression than on ascribing moral blame, and I think he is right to do so. His pragmatist anti-racism especially comes to the fore in Chapters Four and Five where he presses his concern as a challenge to the late political philosopher Charles Mills, writing, “I worry that Mills fails to appreciate the significance of the challenge that in-group psychology poses for rallying mainstream white liberals—both garden variety and academic—around his solution to the race problem” (79).
A key feature of Mills’ response to white supremacy is that “colorblindness” is inadequate to address anti-Black racism in the U.S. and that race-conscious approaches are needed, instead. Darby counters that if Mills is right about liberalism’s investment in white supremacy, then he must be wrong about the viability of race-conscious (or what Darby calls “race-specific”) policy solutions. If whites realize a psychological benefit from racism, then how likely is it that cognitive interventions—attempts to teach and explain—will override powerful, subconscious drives which are better suited to psychoanalytic diagnosis than to rational debate? Darby argues that if CRT is right about the psychological benefit whites derive from white supremacy, this is all the more reason to regard racist consciousness as permanent and to see very dim prospects for dislodging it through interventions that occur at the level of consciousness.
In Chapter Five, Darby begins to spell out his own positive proposal in greater detail. Instead of trying to dislodge the idea of postracialism (a task he appears to regard as impossible and unfruitful, at least for now), Darby argues that advocates of racial progress should put forward solutions that are compatible with white Americans’ ideological commitment to postracialism. We must, Darby argues, respond not to the conditions we would prefer but to the objective conditions actually existing—and these include white Americans’ tendency to embrace postracialism as an article of faith. The correct approach under these circumstances, Darby argues, is to adopt postracial remedies. He writes, “By ‘postracial remedies,’ we mean remedies that seek pragmatic solutions for the economic, social, and structural problems that disproportionately burden African Americans without treating people differently because of their race” (103).
As a challenge to his view, Darby considers what he calls the “purity objection,” namely, that “postracial remedies are a form of appeasement that concedes too much to the other side.” He says of this objection that “it would likely be raised most forcefully and consistently from the Left” (133). However, this seems to me not a particularly left-wing objection at all, but rather a liberal one. Marxists in particular tend to understand consciousness in a way that Darby might find in some ways consonant with his own pragmatic approach. That is to say, Marxists approach consciousness as part of the objective conditions into which they must intervene, rather than reducing it to mere subjectivity in response to which the most pressing task is to assign moral praise for thinking rightly or blame for thinking wrongly. Many of the beliefs people have are structurally produced, reinforced, and even violently enforced. If the aim is to bring about Black liberation as a really-existing phenomenon, then the relevant question is, as Darby points out, how to intervene in a context in which racist consciousness predominates. This does not necessarily involve analyzing consciousness in a way that holds racists as individually morally responsible for their racism as possible. These two aims might well be at cross-purposes, which I take to be one of Darby’s key and most interesting points.
Darby argues that waiting for white people to take accountability for how past racial injustices have shaped the present, racially unjust, and unequal reality is a losing strategy. However, this does not commit him to the view that moral categories have no place whatsoever in theorizing a response to racial oppression. While Darby is skeptical about the efficaciousness of backward-looking adjudications of moral responsibility in producing a future free of racial oppression, in Chapter Six, he nonetheless advocates “a forward-looking basis for grounding our shared political responsibility to address unjust racial inequality” (137). Rather than “playing the blame game,” as Darby puts it, the aim is instead to encourage everyone, including white people, to play an active role in promoting real democracy from which they all benefit.
The abstraction of “democracy” has the advantage of requiring no particular stance on how past inequalities causally shape present ones. Still, I found myself wondering why we should expect self-interested whites to be any more moved by universalist considerations of democracy than they typically are by particular demands of racial justice.
In Chapters Seven and Eight, Darby discusses voting rights as a paradigmatic example of how one might take his pragmatic approach to social change. He argues that while white Americans might not come around to the race-specific problem of ensuring equal ballot access for Black Americans, they might nonetheless be motivated to ensure “unencumbered access” to the ballot for all Americans irrespective of race, since the latter is necessary in order to make manifest the democratic aspirations of the country and to provide conditions in which the democratic experiment might be made successful. In Chapter Seven, “Power to the People," Darby presents a version of W. E. B. Du Bois’s argument for why universal inclusion in the democratic project is crucial for democracy: “If we are committed to achieving a more perfect democracy—one that moves us closer to securing the broadest measure of justice for all—we have a political duty to address the circumstances that contribute to the masses potentially doing us harm by securing for them certain legal rights” (171).
But doesn’t this assume that America really is fundamentally a democratic project (and, although A Realistic Blacktopia was written before the current dismantling of federal agencies, does this assumption not seem ever less plausible with each passing day)? What if the United States were, primarily, essentially, and fundamentally, the project of developing conditions within which capitalists could operate with as much state power and as little fetter as possible? If democracy is really only ancillary to capitalism and to America’s global dominance—a necessary evil, at best—then would it still be reasonable to assume that Americans are any more united around the value of democracy than they are around racial equality?
Darby devotes the later chapters of A Realistic Blacktopia to equal suffrage as a basic principle of democracy. Ironically, this emphasis on a matter of formal equality simultaneously highlights and obscures how matters of concrete equality are inescapable. You cannot have really equal suffrage without equalizing access to public transportation, paid time off, political education, and candidates who represent a range of interests including the race-specific interests Black Americans have in undoing the legacy of racism. Really unencumbered access to the ballot presupposes exactly the material rearrangement of resources and wealth that is foreclosed by concessions to the same racist consciousness that clings to postracialism.
So, does Darby’s own pragmatist and racial realist argument fall prey to the same weaknesses he has extremely helpfully identified in some versions of Critical Race Theory, namely, staking hopes for racial progress on changes in whites’ racial consciousness that are unlikely to come? I leave this for now as an open question, but what I’d like lastly to note is that in A Realistic Blacktopia, Darby does not seem to articulate a theory of how consciousness can change. While he has very illuminatingly described a dilemma for views that hold that white supremacist consciousness benefits all whites who have it, this in turn leads him to treat racist consciousness not only (and correctly) as an objective condition into which we must intervene, but also as a seemingly immutable one. His answer to the idealist dilemma he’s identified is itself recognition, affirmation, and commitment to ideals: “I have argued that recognizing the fair value of the right to vote constitutes a concrete way of affirming a commitment to the ideal of equality not merely in the abstract but within the context of our participation in the political constitution, which is among the major social institutions that shape our life prospects on fair terms” (206). The final chapter before the epilogue ends by advocating for an “expressive commitment” to universal human dignity (234). The remedies Darby puts forward themselves therefore remain at the level of consciousness.
Real democracy—as Darby of course would agree—can’t be brought about solely through interventions at the level of consciousness. History has shown that it has to be made through means that will themselves often strain at the mainstream boundaries of liberal democratic participation. Participants in the Montgomery Bus Boycott did not simply engage in discourse but rather ground their city to a halt, making it actually impossible for its segregationist practices to continue on as they had before, whether segregationists saw the value of broadening democracy or not.
Darby’s approach to the interaction between racist consciousness and the lived, material reality of racial oppression is a marked advance beyond dominant narratives about this relationship and he is right to attempt to move beyond the pessimistic conclusion implied by the view that all whites benefit, by and large, from the predominance of white supremacist consciousness. However, it is noteworthy that his argument—at least as developed within the confines of this particular book—does not envision a time when anti-racist struggle becomes the conscious, explicit aim of white Americans now or ever. The effort to bring about justice for Black people is instead really taken up by activists who function like Rousseauian Legislators, seeking to bridge a yawning chasm between the people’s understanding and the real ethical demands of the moment. But how can the members of society become a really self-conscious, self-aware polity and not just a collective of individuals whose petty bigotries we must work around? Surely the former is what true rule by the people, of the people, and for the people must be.
I think the answer is that just as Darby is quite right to conclude in the Epilogue of A Realistic Blacktopia that we must “unite to fight,” it is also true that we must fight to unite. My own view (a Marxist one) is that white supremacy harms most white Americans on balance and that therefore it is in their objective interest to oppose it whether they realize this or not. Indeed, insofar as Darby’s view is that racial oppression is incompatible with democracy that is in most whites’ self-interest, his position on this question is ultimately not so far removed from mine.
As anti-racist activists relate to people who, for example, see the abstract desirability of “democracy” but not of racial justice, part of our aim must be to produce objective material circumstances in which the call for racial justice takes the form of a demand that is harder to ignore or deny. This is precisely what the nonviolent but highly confrontational methods of the Civil Rights Movement sought to do. This runs the risk of alienating those who oppose the anti-racist struggle, but raises the political consciousness of others who come to see its importance more clearly once the racist (and, by extension, undemocratic) functions of the state are brought out into the open.
While focusing on organizing those already politically closest to us may feel like an instance of preaching to the proverbial choir, the point is not only to convince people of the abstract moral correctness of antiracism, but to encourage them to engage in the kind of direct, organized confrontation with racist institutions that teaches them much more about the nature of American “democracy” than theory alone ever could. This is what I mean when I agree with Darby that we must unite to fight, but add that we must also fight to unite, for as Darby’s book helps show, there is no ready-made “we.” Engaging in struggle against racist institutions and policies—even where it means eschewing opportunities for universal consensus in the short run—helps promote truly democratic transformation. This is so, because it provides the opportunity for people to develop themselves as more fully self-conscious and active participants in the work of building the movement for racial equality. It relates to existing consciousness as one of the objective social conditions to which activists must relate, an approach Darby powerfully and convincingly advocates throughout A Realistic Blacktopia. Yet, it also lays out a strategy for raising mass consciousness, in ways that can in turn render a wider array of political and material transformations also newly possible.
Darby’s book is extremely helpful for thinking through these and related questions about how to intervene in our present circumstances to advance the struggle against anti-Black racism and all other forms of racist oppression. Especially salutary is his focus on the relationship between ideal and material conditions (a question which is almost always central to debates in philosophy of race although not often enough explicitly so). Also especially valuable is his identification of a seemingly insoluble puzzle at the heart of some CRT analyses—namely, that they propose race-specific remedies to the unequal circumstances Blacks face, yet these remedies are likely doomed from the start if CRT’s own theory of white supremacist consciousness and whom it serves is correct.
Darby’s proposed solution is to eschew race-specific remedies in favor of “realist” ones which meet the (racist) people where they are by appealing instead to values, such as democracy, which are more likely to be universally shared and less likely to trigger racist backlash. I’ve suggested here that there’s not much more reason to think Americans at large are committed to democracy than there is to think they are, at present, particularly moved by the plight of Blacks. But this needn’t move us to despair. While Darby is absolutely correct that consciousness must be related to as an objective condition about which we must be realistic, it can nonetheless be changed through struggles to alter the material conditions within which that consciousness is formed. I take this to be well in keeping with the spirit of a central theme animating A Realistic Blacktopia, namely, that the realm of consciousness cannot be the only one in which antiracists carry out our fight.