In his magisterial, three-volume Also a History of Philosophy (AHP; German: Auch eine Geschichte der Philosophie, 2 Vols., Suhrkamp 2019), Habermas sets forth an extended historical defense of central elements of Western modernity, specifically its commitment to ideals of moral egalitarianism, universal human rights, and constitutional democracy. Habermas argues that these commitments emerged from collective learning processes, which AHP reconstructs in detail, beginning in Volume I with the transition from mythical thought to the great religious-metaphysical systems that emerged in Eurasian cultures during the so-called Axial Age (c. 800-300 B.C.E.). Volumes II and III then trace the Western “discourse of faith and knowledge” from the encounter between Greek philosophy and Christianity, through the Middles Ages and into modernity, when philosophy declared its independence from religion. NDPR reviews of Volumes II and III are already available.[1] Here I review Volume I, which comprises three lengthy chapters. The preface and first chapter set forth the motivations, method, and assumptions that structure the “project” announced by the subtitle, “a genealogy of postmetaphysical thinking”. Chapters II and III focus on the origins of religion in myth and ritual (II) and the Axial Age (III).
Motivations, Method, Assumptions. As Habermas makes clear in the first sentences in the preface, AHP is first of all a work motivated by the love of philosophy—“the pleasure in finally getting to read the many important texts I had previously neglected, and in rereading many other texts…” (xvii).[2] To be sure, a larger “meta-theoretical” question is at stake, namely, how ought we to understand “the task of philosophy today”? Behind that question lies Habermas’s fear that disciplinary specialization is killing the holistic character of the philosophical tradition, which from Plato through the great nineteenth-century philosophers engaged central questions of human existence, such as Kant’s questions about the scope of knowledge, demands of morality, and prospects for hope. Habermas fears that “the very format of those questions” is becoming obsolete, supplanted by a philosophy specializing in conceptual analysis, applied ethics, and “the administration of its own history” (xix).
At issue in that fear are the implicit “paradigmatic presuppositions” behind the different ways that philosophers approach basic questions (xviii). Habermas sees much of contemporary philosophy as falling into two paradigms. The Humean paradigm tends to start with individual mental states and is prone to scientism, whereas the tradition following Kant and Hegel attends more to social-linguistic practices and traditions. To understand how philosophy reached that divide, Habermas goes beyond a history of ideas to reconstruct a sociohistorically situated genealogy that tracks the changing self-understanding of philosophy that led up to those two paradigms, both of which rejected the Christian religious-metaphysical worldview in favor of a secular, “postmetaphysical” approach. The question is whether we can see in that history the evolution of a robust holistic approach intent on providing us with practical, existential orientation. As it turns out, only in the post-Kantian tradition, running through the German Idealists to such thinkers as Marx, Kierkegaard, and Peirce, does Habermas see a holistic postmetaphysical vision centered on the rational freedom of socialized human agents. The answer to Habermas’s fears for the future of philosophy hangs on the prospects for that tradition.
In contrast to Nietzsche’s subversive genealogy of morality, Habermas’s genealogy is largely “vindicatory”, as it aims to defend modern thought and institutions as reasonable outcomes of historical learning processes (37-38; citing Allen, 2013). Guided by his theory of communicative action, Habermas identifies and reconstructs those deeper cognitive-moral achievements behind the flux of ideas and instutions. At the same time, the genealogical framework highlights the contingency of historical learning. Philosophical systems of thought develop and change through argumentation, but they also respond to contingent exogenous challenges, such as new empirical knowledge, growing societal complexity and pluralism, and social-political crises—thereby shaping social integration and collective self-understanding.
But why focus on the discourse between knowledge and faith (Wissen und Glauben)? Superficially, the answer is straightforward: historically, Western philosophy emerged from the encounter between ancient Greek philosophy and Christianity. Moreover, the Kantian strand of postmetaphysical thinking retains secularized remnants of that religious heritage, for example, ideas of universal human dignity and personal responsibility, which inform democratic constitutions and shape our moral-political self-understanding. But more is at stake here than simply appreciating the past. As it turns out, religion lies at the core of Habermas’s cosmopolitan project. The relevance of philosophy for furthering that project depends on acknowledging the debt that secular thought owes to its religious heritage and continuing the dialogue with religion. For that dialogue might yet extend “the universe of secular argument—for instance, in the face of categorically new challenges such as the abolition of the naturalness of the human organism” (337-38 note 8).
The full scope of Habermas’s ambitious project—and the importance of religion in it—becomes apparent in Chapter I.3. There, he tackles the most obvious objection, that a Eurocentric genealogy, focused on the evolution of philosophy in the West, cannot justify the universal claims he wants to make for such modern achievements as constitutional democracy. In reply, Habermas admits that a universalistic justification would require “an intercultural discourse among equal participants who are aware of their fallibility and are willing to learn” (66). In other words, his genealogical argument is, necessarily, incomplete. The genealogy is an intervention, put forth in the hope of encouraging an ever-widening discourse across cultures. The stakes are high, nothing less than the future of our globalized world. For if humanity is to meet global challenges—humanitarian, environmental, financial, technological, etc.—then it must extend the learning processes that produced modern achievements and construct a robust, cosmopolitan constitutional order, whose legitimacy rests on an intercultural agreement regarding the principles of international justice.
Habermas assumes that cultures steeped in traditional religion pose one of the main obstacles to such an agreement. He thus sketches a “thought experiment” that charts a possible path of learning for believers, beginning with interreligious dialogues and then moving into dialogues with secular nonbelievers (76-82). The thought experiment envisions a depth of global agreement that goes far beyond the overlapping consensus that led to the UN Declaration on Human Rights. An effective cosmopolitan order would require agreement not only on specific rights and principles, and not only on the reasons that support them, but also on the “operative conditions to specify and apply agreed-upon norms to the relevant conflicts in need of resolution” (349 note 29).
Why should we have any hope that a cosmopolitan discourse of that sort is even remotely possible? The remainder of Volume I addresses that question by offering evidence that the moral universalism emergent in the West can also be found in the axial heritages of other cultures.
The Core of Religion. In the second chapter, Habermas lays out the basic elements of religion. Religious traditions, he explains, “preserve the unity of the interpretation of the world with a ritual practice” (117). That “sacred complex” of worldview and ritual has pre-historic origins, first evident in the myths and rituals of early tribal groups. In developing that idea, Habermas seeks to go beyond sociological explanations that reduce religion to a coping mechanism in the face of a precarious existence. Functionalist approaches, he argues, cannot adequately explain the evolution of religion. For that, we must adopt the participant perspective, striving to grasp the meaning of the sacred complex for the participants themselves. Surveying the literature, Habermas settles on the idea that the key to understanding religion lies in its archaic ritual core, which emerged at the dawn of language. Rituals exemplify the human capacity for communication based on symbols that have the same meaning for members of the group, allowing them to relate to each other as second persons while simultaneously referring to states of affairs. Even before the advent of developed grammars, shared symbols allowed early hominids to cooperate in more complex activities, such as big game hunting. Unlike everyday cooperation, however, ritual practices are self-referential: they do not seem to refer to specific objects in the objective world. To what, then, do they respond?
To grasp the meaning of ritual for participants, Habermas turns to the mythical narratives that arose with grammatically developed languages. With grammatical structure came the ability to separate out the representative aspect of symbols from its fusion with appellative and expressive dimensions; simultaneously, the system of personal pronouns enabled individuals to assert themselves as first persons over against the collective. Language thus created a double challenge: the need to process the overwhelming flood of information released by representations at the cognitive level, while managing a new, ambivalent mode of social integration at the socio-moral level that could secure both individual and collective self-understanding.
Mythical narratives respond to the first challenge by creating coherent worldviews. Drawing on the performative know-how implicit in everyday life, myths explain natural phenomena as the result of interactions in which humans, gods, and personified natural forces encounter each other on the same plane. Rituals respond to the second, socio-moral challenge. With the advent of the linguistic capacity for individual self-assertion, social integration must negotiate the “complementary dangers of exclusion and hyper-inclusion” (172). The group now confronts “the individual members as an overwhelming all-consuming force and simultaneously as a sustaining power that guarantees survival and security” (176). Cooperation thus requires authoritative traditions and normative obligations. Therein lies the power of ritual—a “practice that recapitulates and renews the original process of generating normativity”. Through the “emotionally charged merging of many individuals” in rituals, members invoke the favor of a superior (sacred) power against misfortune and renew their solidarity (179).
As egalitarian tribal societies developed into more complex, bureaucratically organized states in the third millennium B.C.E., mythical worldviews served to legitimate the political authority of the ruler. Hierarchies of gods emerged, but they remained part of the human world. The idea of a transcendent divinity that explains natural phenomena would first emerge with the axial systems of thought in the first millennium B.C.E.
The Axial Age. Social-structural changes, Habermas insists, cannot account for the innovations of the Axial Age. We must, again, adopt the participant perspective, attending to “endogenous learning processes” (197). Though the various axial worldviews differed in particulars, they all shared a broadly similar insight, namely, an abstraction toward a transcendent reference point on reality as a whole—God or cosmic law—that both explained appearances and dictated the path of salvation (Heil) in terms of an exemplary life or ethical conduct. That move responded to the inadequacies of mythical worldviews for assimilating new empirical and social-moral knowledge. The insight was personally triggered, however, by contingent “crisis experiences”—shock or moral outrage at the injustice and oppression, violence, or suffering that axial figures such as Confucius, Siddartha Gautama, and the Jewish prophets saw in their societies (198).
For Habermas’s cosmopolitan project, the moral side of the axial innovation is clearly the more important, as it engendered a “moralization of the sacred” that transformed everyday morality into paths of salvation, endowing local ethical practices with “a transcending force whose normative power outstrips everyday practice” (223). The brunt of Chapter III is to support a bold interpretation of that transformation, namely, that “all those [axial] traditions that continue to shape contemporary civilizations…contain the same cognitive potential…they crystallize around the core initial idea of moral universalism” (210). If that claim holds up, then each culture can bring its own universalist conception of justice to the intercultural discourse on justice sketched in Chapter I.3. Chapter III thus examines (most of) the major axial systems of thought: Judaism, Buddhism, Confucianism, Taoism, and ancient Greek philosophy (Pre-Socratics and Plato). That list has some major gaps if we think about today’s cultures, in particular, Hinduism, whose ancient predecessor, Brahminism, makes only a brief appearance as a precursor to Buddhism. Moreover, his sweeping claim for axial cultures—that they all combined a transcendent viewpoint with an ethical path of salvation—is stretched thin at points. Confucian ethics, for example, “leaves individual needs for salvation largely unsatisfied” (274).
In any case, the ancient Judaic and Greek worldviews are the most important for Western philosophy. The moralization of the sacred in the Judaic worldview is evident in the story of the covenant that emerged from Moses’ encounter with God on Mount Sinai. There, we see the idea of a single transcendent God, beyond all images, who intervenes in history, entering into an interpersonal relationship with the Israelites. For the covenant is addressed directly to the people, who must ratify it with their free collective consent. In that consent, Habermas sees the kernel of egalitarianism. God for his part reveals himself as a saving God who emancipates the Israelites; the people in turn promise obedience to the Torah, whose unconditionally binding moral commandments constitute the path of salvation. In the covenant with Israel, then, we can already discern “an essentially egalitarian-universalistic political and social order” (228). In contrast to Judaism—and also Confucianism and Buddhism—the axial advances we see in the Presocratics, Socrates, and Plato are elitist. Because the Greek path of salvation is an epistemic one, the life of philosophical contemplation, salvation is above all for the educated elite. Thus, the more important Greek contributions lie in their metaphysics and reflections on the ideal polis. The former will transform Christian self-understanding, while the latter marks the beginning of political theory.
To conclude: AHP is first of all a practical intervention into our contemporary situation, and so we should judge it. As he once explained, “My motive for addressing the issue of faith and knowledge is to mobilize modern reason against the defeatism lurking within it” (2010, 18). In reconstructing a genealogy of collective moral-political learning, Habermas hopes to encourage intellectuals to carry those progressive impulses forward to a more effective cosmopolitan order. Volume I is important for clarifying Habermas’s conception of his task and core understanding of religion. The latter has ongoing relevance for his secular project—and not merely as an obstacle to overcome. For Habermas sees that practicing faith communities enjoy resources for hope that nonbelievers lack—but that remain necessary for the vitality of secular modernity:
reason itself would wither away with the disappearance of any thought that transcends what exists in the world as a whole. The defense against this entrophy is a point of contact between postmetaphysical thought and religious consciousness, as long as the latter is embodied in the liturgical practice of a community of believers…Ritual claims to connect with a power breaking into the world from transcendence. (AHP III, 437)
Habermas’s insistence on the importance of religious practice follows directly from his understanding of religion, as explicated in AHP I. In the liturgical practices of religious communities, we can see the traces of the archaic sacred core. As an out-of-the-ordinary form of life, religion remains “a thorn in the flesh” of a self-satisfied secular consciousness, “keeping the memory of a powerful awareness of transcendence alive for its secular environment” (51, 131; emphasis removed).
REFERENCES
Allen, Amy (2013) “Having One’s Cake and Eating It Too: Habermas’s Genealogy of Postsecular Reason.” In Craig Calhoun, Eduardo Mendieta, and Jonathan VanAntwerpen (eds), Habermas and Religion, 132-153. Cambridge, UK: Polity.
Habermas, Jürgen, et al. (2010) An Awareness of What Is Missing, C. Cronin (trans.). Cambridge, UK: Polity.
[1] By Martin Jay (2025) and Andrew Buchwalter (2026), resp.
[2] Unless otherwise noted, all intralinear page references refer to AHP, volume I.