Barriers to Entailment: Hume’s Law and Other Limits to Logical Consequence

First things first. Barriers to Entailment (henceforward BtE) is a brilliant book, a major contribution to metaethics and philosophy of logic, with important implications (or so it seems to me) for philosophy of time, the metaphysics of supervenience and the logic of indexicals. I am not going to say that it is compulsory reading (at least for meta-ethicists and logicians), since that suggests that it is a chore to read, which it most definitely is not. The writing is fresh, friendly, funny and unpretentious (though occasionally erring on the side of brevity), and though it is sometimes a bit hard-going for the merely logically literate (as opposed to battle-hardened logicians), it is nonetheless a pleasure to read (a bit like a stiff walk up a steep hill on a fine day, leading to wide vistas). But if you have not read, learned and inwardly digested this book, you won’t be able, in the future, to write competently about the Is/Ought question and related matters, and you will be a bit borderline when it comes to the philosophy of logic, indexicals and the philosophy of time. The book should also be of interest to historians of philosophy, since it develops important themes in the work of Hume, Kant, and (Bertrand) Russell.

So why is BtE so important? The book is a response (but not just a response!) to Prior’s seminal (1960) paper ‘The Autonomy of Ethics’, in which he develops a set of counterexamples to Hume’s famous No-Ought-from-Is thesis (henceforth NOFI). Simplifying ruthlessly, we can present Prior’s argument as a dilemma, featuring two examples (though Prior had many others):

Tea-Drinker 1

(T1) Tea-drinking is common in England.

Therefore:

(T2) Either Tea-drinking is common in England or all New Zealanders ought to be shot.

Tea-Drinker 2

(T1*) Tea-drinking is NOT common in England.

(T2) Either Tea-drinking is common in England or all New Zealanders ought to be shot.

Therefore:

(T3) All New Zealanders ought to be shot.

Either sentence (T2) is moral, or it is not. If it is moral, then Tea-Drinker 1 is an inference from nonmoral premises to a moral conclusion. If it is not moral, then Tea-Drinker 2 is an inference from nonmoral premises to a moral conclusion. Either way, we have an argument from nonmoral premises to a moral or normative conclusion, and hence, a counterexample to NOFI as usually understood. And note that Prior does not use any fancy non-logical devices to construct his counterexamples to NOFI—this is all pure logic.

By 2003 (when Russell first began presenting on the topic), there were two attempts to reformulate and prove versions of NOFI that were immune to Prior’s counterexamples: one due to Charles Pigden (1989), the other to Gerhard Schurz (1997). Pigden sees NOFI as an instance of the conservativeness of logic, the idea (going back centuries) that in a logically valid argument, the conclusion is contained in the premises. Hence, Prior’s counterexamples are not just counterexamples to NOFI but counterexamples to conservativeness. Pigden’s solution is to develop and prove a Prior-resistant version of conservativeness, from which a Prior-resistant version of NOFI follows automatically. If a (moral) term appears in the conclusion of valid argument but not in the premises, it will suffer from inference-relative vacuity: you can replace it with any old (nonmoral) rubbish you like, and the inference will still be valid. Thus, there is a sense in which sentence (T2) when it appears as a conclusion in Tea-Drinker 1 is not really moral, since its apparently moral content—all New Zealanders ought to be shot—is replaceable with anything you like (such as All New-Zealanders are hedgehogs) salva validate. Hence, Tea-Drinker 1 is not a counterexample to NOFI.

On the other hand, when (T2) appears as a premise in Tea-Drinker 2, it is authentically moral since the moral content can’t be replaced salve validitate. The weakness of Pigden’s approach is that conservativeness only applies to categorematic or non-logical expressions and hence won’t apply to ‘ought’ if deontic logics are genuine logics—a thesis he is compelled to deny. Schurz, by contrast, construes ‘ought’ as a logical or syncategorematic expression, thus allowing that deontic logics may be genuine logics. But he is able to prove that if a moral expression occurs in the conclusion of a valid inference but not in the premises, then it will be ‘ought-irrelevant’ since everything within its scope can be replaced with any old rubbish you like, salva validate. Thus, the reason that sentence (T2) is not really moral when it appears in the conclusion of Tea-Drinker 1 is that the material occurring within the scope of the ‘ought’—that all New Zealanders be shot—can be replaced with anything whatsoever, including that New Zealanders be praised pampered and preserved, without prejudice to the validity of the inference.

Enter Gillian Russell. In her (2010)—originally delivered as far back as 2003—she pointed out that there are Prior-type counterexamples not only to NOFI but to several other ‘Barriers to Entailment’:

(Bertrand) Russell’s Law (to avoid confusion, BR’s Law): You can’t get a general or universal sentence from particular ones.

Hume’s Second Law: You can’t get a sentence about the future from sentences about the past or present.

Kant’s Law: You can’t get sentences saying that something is necessarily the case from sentences which say how things actually are.

In Barriers to Entailment, Russell adds the following law:

The Indexical Law: you can’t get indexical claims—claims featuring such expressions as ‘I’, ‘here’ and ‘now’—from claims that are not indexical.

(I may know that the suspect will be arrested without being able to deduce that I will be arrested, unless I know that I am the suspect.)

All these ‘laws’ are subject to numerous Prior-type counterexamples. For instance:

Apostle 1:

(1A) Moore was an Apostle.

Therefore:

(2A) Either Moore was an Apostle or all the Cambridge Spies were Apostles.

Apostle 2

(1A*) Moore was not an Apostle.

(2A) Either Moore was an Apostle or all the Cambridge Spies were Apostles.

Therefore:

(3A) All the Cambridge spies were Apostles.

(1A) looks pretty particular, yet it entails (2A), which looks universal since it is about all the Cambridge spies. Suppose, though, that (2A) isn’t really universal but particular. Then Apostle 2 is an inference from particular premises to a universal conclusion.

Climate 1:

(1C) Moore was an Apostle.

Therefore:

(2C) Either Moore was an Apostle or there will be a climate change catastrophe and billions will die.

Climate 2

(1C*) Moore was not an Apostle.

(2C) Either Moore was an Apostle or there will be a climate change catastrophe and billions will die.

Therefore:

(3C) There will be a climate change catastrophe and billions will die.

(1C) is clearly about the past, yet it entails (2C), which seems to be about the future. Suppose, though, that (2C) isn’t really about the future but only about the past. Then Climate 2 is an inference from premises about the past to a conclusion about the future.

Russell claims that in each case the authors of these ‘laws’ are clearly onto something. Hence, it would be premature to drop them despite the counterexamples. The right strategy is to reformulate and prove. We need Prior-proof and provable versions of each of these ‘laws’. It is a plus, furthermore, if each of these laws can be seen as variations on a theme. Pigden’s approach won’t work if any of the key operators are construed as logical expressions. And Schurz’s solution has insufficient generality, since it applies only to modal-type logics without bridging principles and hence won’t help with BR’s Law, which does not involve modal operators at all. Russell herself developed a solution in Restall and Russell (2010), but the Restall/Russell approach suffers from technical problems, noted by both Vranas (2010) and Schurz (2010). These are triumphantly resolved in her solo solution, as developed in BtE.

The key idea here (again, simplifying rather ruthlessly) is that with respect to each ‘law’, there are various kinds of sentences, some of which are (in my terminology) vulnerable and others not. Vulnerability is defined in terms of variations on models. If a non-vulnerable sentence is true at a model, then it retains its truth-value even if the original model is transformed in various ways, for instance, by being extended or switched. The sentence

The Cambridge spies, Burgess and McLean, fled to Russia.

if true at a model, won’t stop being true, however many Cambridge spies you add to the model who did not flee to Russia. Thus, it is non-vulnerable with respect to model extensions (relevant in connection with BR’s Law). By contrast,

All the Cambridge Spies fled to Russia.

is true at a model that only contains Burgess and Mclean but false at an extended model that also contains Blunt and Cairncross, the Cambridge spies who did not flee to Russia but elected to remain in the UK. Hence, it is vulnerable with respect to model extensions.

The sentence

Tea–drinking is common in England.

is non-vulnerable with respect to deontic model switching. If it is true in a model, it will remain true however much you mess with the set of ideal (or superb) worlds that determine what ought to be. (OA is true in a model in standard deontic logics iff A holds at all the ideal or superb worlds.) By contrast,

All New Zealanders ought to be shot.

will be true (given standard deontic semantics) at a model in which all New Zealanders are shot at all the ideal worlds but false in a model at which the ideal (or superb) worlds contain un-shot New Zealanders. Hence, it is vulnerable with respect to model switches (switching which worlds count as ideal).

Unfortunately, there is more than one way to be vulnerable, and hence more than one way to be non-vulnerable, or anti-vulnerable, with respect to the various kinds of model extensions and model switches (switching which worlds are ideal or which worlds represent the future). A sentence (or a set of sentences) can be fragile with respect to a class models iff to every model in which it is true, there corresponds a model-variation in which it is false. Or a sentence (or a set of sentences) can be breakable iff there is some model at which it is true and a corresponding model-variation at which it is false. Since the idea, very roughly, is to define non-normativity, particularity, pastness, and non-indexicality in terms of non-vulnerability and normativity, universality, futurity and indexicality in terms of vulnerability, this generates different versions of the five laws with different kinds of caveats and qualifications, depending on whether fragility or breakability is the operative concept.

No space to delve into these complexities here, so I shall simply summarise some of the key results. Note that in these versions of the Barrier Laws, it is the premise set that is particular or non-normative or about the past, NOT the individual sentences that constitute the set. (Here Russell differs significantly from Schurz and Pigden.) Note, too, that all these formulae are both provable and proven. First, BR’s Law (Note: a set of sentences is particular iff there is no model at which all of its members are true such that some of those members can be falsified by adding extra items to the model.):

Let Γ be a set of sentences which is particular and satisfiable and φ a sentence such that Γ ∪ φ is universal, then Γ ⊮ φ

Apostle 1 is not a counterexample since the premise/conclusion set consisting of (1A) and (2A) is not universal. Apostle 2 is not a counterexample since the premise set consisting of (1A*) and (2A) is not particular.

Secondly, Hume’s First Law or NOFI:

If (the set of sentences) Γ is s-shift-insensitive (descriptive) and φ is s-shift sensitive (normative), then Γ ⊮ φ unless for all models M of Γ, every model N such that N is an s-shift of M, is such that φ is true.

Tea-Drinker 1 is not a counterexample, since it comes under the ‘unless’ clause. (T1) is s-shift insensitive (its truth-value is not dependent on which worlds are ideal), but for all models M of (T1) such that (T1) is true, every model N such that N is an s-shift of M is such that (T2) is true. Tea-Drinker 2 is not a counterexample either, since the premise set consisting of (T1*) and (T2) is not shift-insensitive, since its truth-value depends on which worlds are ideal.

Finally, Hume’s Second Law:

If Γ is Purely Past and Γ ∪ {φ} is Partly Future, then Γ ⊮ φ

Climate 1 is not a counterexample, since although (C1) is ‘Purely Past’ (true, whatever the future holds), the premise/conclusion set (C1) ∪ (C2) is also ‘Purely Past’, since despite (C2)’s futuristic vocabulary, the set will remain true whether there is a climate catastrophe or not. Climate 2 is not a counterexample, since the premise set consisting of (C1*) and (C2) is not purely past, since if there were no climate catastrophe, the set of sentences would be false.

Importantly, Russell is able to prove that all these barrier theses are variations on a theme. She gives a unified proof of all the entailment-barrier theses, in the context of a unified but complex quantified-modal-indexical-temporal-deontic logic. Thus, she meets what she herself argued was prime desideratum in her (2010a).

Two important take-home messages:

1) Russell’s proof of (her version of) NOFI provides no support whatsoever for a strong Fact/Value distinction, if that is supposed to mean that value-claims are non-factual or lack a truth-value. Argument: The reasons that you can’t derive substantive normative claims from non-normative premises are essentially the same as the reasons that you can’t derive substantive claims about the general from claims about the particular or substantive claims about the future from claims about the past. Nobody supposes that BR’s Law or Hume’s Second Law establishes a Fact/Universal distinction or a Fact/Future distinction, where universal claims or claims about the future are not supposed to have a (full-blooded) truth-value. Hence, Russell’s version of NOFI (and this is also true of Pigden’s) provides no support whatsoever for anything like non-cognitivism. Since you cannot derive a strong Fact/Value distinction from NOFI, if you dislike such a distinction, there is no need to attack NOFI, which is fortunate since several versions of NOFI (including, of course, Russell’s) are provably true.

2) The alleged supervenience of the moral on the nonmoral does not pose a threat to NOFI. The idea seems to be that since a set of nonmoral facts somehow necessitates the supervening moral facts, a statement of the nonmoral facts logically entails a statement of those moral facts. But it is clear that the allegedly necessary conditional stating that if there are non-normative base facts of kind X then there will be a corresponding normative fact of kind Y, if true at all, won’t be logically true. Hence, no threat to NOFI.

Being in the same line of business, I naturally have criticisms to make of Russell’s book, some friendly, some less so. But these can wait until enough philosophers have read the book, which is what they are already doing at all the ideal worlds.