In Kathryn Sophia Belle’s deliberately bold Beauvoir and Belle: A Black Feminist Critique of “The Second Sex”, the author asks, “did Beauvoir ever read the work of Black women?” (315). Belle finds that not only did Beauvoir not engage the ideas of Black women writers, the secondary literature on Beauvoir by white women writers has repeated this lack of engagement. Belle devastatingly retells the story of The Second Sex, not as the ex nihilo beginning of a second wave of feminist theory and activism, but as a misconceived intervention mid-way through several centuries of (Black) women’s writings on the inherent interconnectedness of race and gender.
For Belle, when you talk about gender, you are always making claims about race, and vice versa, whether or not you make this explicit. Belle argues that The Second Sex is a book about gender that doesn’t acknowledge the role of race in its claims. This is the case insofar as The Second Sex fundamentally relies on “comparative and competing frameworks of oppression, including [Beauvoir’s] use of the race/gender analogy as well as the more specific metaphor of woman as slave” (165). This strategy of making the Othering of women—in the abstract—visible by invoking racialization and racism as distinct social phenomena, relevant only for the purposes of launching a detached set of claims about gender, only seems available to Beauvoir in her position as a white French woman of relative privilege in the French colonial empire when The Second Sex was written.
While Beauvoir may be an anti-racist and anti-colonial thinker, The Second Sex obscures Women of Color and their lived experiences. Belle argues that by distinguishing race from gender, sometimes comparing them and sometimes contrasting them, The Second Sex “codes race as Black male and gender as white female, ignoring the ways in which Black women and other Women of Color experience racism and sexism—or racialized sexism and sexualized racism—simultaneously” (168). Though this book builds on arguments that Belle herself has made previously, as well as the work of others covered in the book, such as Margaret Simons, Audre Lorde, Alia Al-Saji, and Stephanie Rivera Berruz, it makes the case for the problems with the approach to gender of The Second Sex more comprehensively than ever before.
Kathryn Sophia Belle begins by recalling bell hooks’s essay, “True Philosophers: Beauvoir and bell”, which serves as both an inspiration and a case in point. Belle finds that Black feminist responses to The Second Sex, though there have been many, have never seemed to get through to white feminists’ enthusiasm for Beauvoir’s single axis analysis of gender. Black feminist readings of Beauvoir are rarely taken up by white feminist philosophers. Following bell hooks’s essay, Kathryn Sophia Belle channels “bell hooks’ boldness by naming myself alongside Simone de Beauvoir in the title of my book” (2). Belle’s method in Beauvoir and Belle is also inspired by bell hooks’s essay. Beauvoir and Belle seeks to reintroduce The Second Sex in the context of and in conversation with Black feminist philosophy. In doing so, Belle hopes to set the record straight on Beauvoir’s race-gender analogy. Though arguably definitive of a majority of white feminist philosophies in French and English of the late twentieth century, the analogy is unsound.
The book is divided into three parts. The first part is a re-telling of the history of Black feminist theories of identity and oppression that may not be new for readers but which articulates a trajectory in which Belle will later situate Beauvoir. Chapter One is a survey beginning with eighteenth century writers Lucy Terry and Phillis Wheatley, through the nineteenth, early twentieth, and late twentieth centuries, ending with Kimberlé Williams Crenshaw. This is followed by a separate chapter each for three Black feminist philosophers who facilitated engagement with The Second Sex in the U.S.: Claudia Jones (Chapter Two), Lorraine Hansberry (Chapter Three), and Audre Lorde (Chapter Four).
The second part of the book turns to an analysis of The Second Sex itself. Chapter Five discusses the book’s “analogical approach”, which Belle sums up as “the use of racial oppression as an analogy for gender oppression”. Chapter Six addresses what Belle takes to be one instance of this analogy, “the woman-as-slave metaphor” (206). Part Two finishes with a chapter on Black feminist accounts of the political movements for the abolition of slavery and the extension of suffrage. While Simone de Beauvoir’s account of this broad period does “not consider white abolitionists’ and suffragists’ racism” and the role of this racism in the ways in which white women sought suffrage for themselves, thinkers such as Angela Davis, Ida B. Wells, Paula Giddings, and Deborah King offer a way of interpreting the work of Black women in these movements as seeking “universal suffrage”, in spite of its being thwarted by both white men and white women whose needs are responsible for the misguided race-gender analogy.
The final section of the book, Part Three, is composed of an eighth and final chapter and a conclusion. Here, Belle turns to critiques of Beauvoir that have been made in recent years by Sally Markowitz, Alia Al-Saji, Kyoo Lee, Stephanie Rivera Berruz, and Oyèrónke Oyewùmi, all of which help Belle to reconcile “Beauvoir’s grand historical narratives” (25) about (white) women with the “orientalism, the colonial gaze, and the coloniality of gender [that] contribute to Beauvoir’s problematic representations of Indians, Asians (she uses the term ‘Orientals’), Arabs, and Muslims…, [and] the imperceptibility of Latinas” in The Second Sex (266). In the conclusion, Belle returns to the work of Audre Lorde and argues that “coalition”, organizing across difference, is “facilitated by intersectionality, including intersectional critiques of white feminism”, not daunted by it (320). This conclusion offers Audre Lorde’s insistence on the importance of directly addressing white feminists’ misrepresentations and exclusions of Women of Color as a contemporary model of coalition across theories and cultures for the present.
This book should change the way Beauvoir scholars and feminist philosophers more generally think about Simone de Beauvoir’s contribution to culture. The Second Sex is often heralded as a watershed moment, a relatively lonesome catalyst for the cultural focus of second wave feminist thought. But Belle suggests that perhaps what was so transformative was in fact the rhetorical intervention of the race-gender analogy. This analogy allowed white feminists of the mid-late twentieth century to articulate their social position with a deceptive starkness. While this analogy could only ever make sense from the point of view of a white French woman seated near, if not in, a center of colonial power, Beauvoir’s work was taken up by numerous Black feminist philosophers who related to some aspects of its message.
However, Belle demonstrates that the resources for questioning the stability of this rhetorical intervention have been there all along—for centuries and right up into the present. Why then is Beauvoir’s book so revered? Is it only owed to the seeming compellingness of this analogy? I have remarked elsewhere that The Second Sex is perhaps best thought of as Beauvoir’s unacknowledged seventh memoir. But many regard this book as so much more than memoir, perhaps as a chronicle of white women’s experiences of white culture. After Belle’s book, I take it to be an open question what Beauvoir’s legacy really is, and of what it consists, without the race-gender analogy.
One aspect of The Second Sex that appears to be uncommented upon in Beauvoir and Belle is Simone de Beauvoir’s interest in the philosophical history and presupposed duality of sexual difference. Kathryn Sophia Belle, like virtually all philosophers writing on Beauvoir, takes her focus to have been gender, a concept popularized among feminists as the opposite of the apolitical nature of dimorphic sex in Sexual Politics, a 1969 work by white feminist U.S. literary theorist, Kate Millett. Millett introduced the sex-gender distinction and championed it for feminist purposes. For Millett, while the apolitical nature of dualistic sex places it beyond human agency, gender is entirely political, hierarchical, and eliminable. Millett’s particular articulation of the sex-gender distinction would turn out to set the stage for “gender critical feminism”, which is simultaneously dimorphic sex fundamentalism. All of this of course takes place after The Second Sex, but it gets taken up and retroactively applied to The Second Sex.
I read The Second Sex as a book about sex, disputing the monolithic interpretation one finds in Aristotle, as well as the dimorphic interpretation one finds in Immanuel Kant. The problem is that The Second Sex does not say enough to directly dispute the post-Millettian, retroactive reading of the sex-gender distinction. And so this aspect of The Second Sex has largely been overlooked by Beauvoir scholars in my view, and Beauvoir and Belle is no exception.
This does not mean that Beauvoir and Belle is not still necessary reading for anyone interested in feminist philosophy. It ought to mark a fundamental change in the secondary literature on The Second Sex. Moreover, as a representative study of the history of feminist philosophy and the race-gender analogy that has shaped much of this history from the mid-twentieth century to the present, Beauvoir and Belle should be on the reading list of every feminist philosopher.