Being We: Phenomenological Contributions to Social Ontology

I’m late to meet you at the restaurant. You brush aside my apology on arrival, since we’re friends, and we sit down, get drinks, eventually food. On your way back from the bathroom, you sit back down saying, “We just bombed a school”. Taking in the news, we decry the state of the nation domestically, and the evil it’s wreaking abroad. “I just don’t know what this country is anymore; it doesn’t represent me.” You disagree with my claim that it doesn’t represent me, and we argue. Through argument, the conversation spills over into other matters of life, and when the bill comes, we forget about it, but when the time comes, I tell you I’ve got this one; relenting, you tell me you’re paying next time, which I dismiss. Outside, we hug goodbye and promise to text each other when we get home, and you and I each go our own way.

The above is a bit of reality, depicting a number of things essentially social: my perpetually being late, and your seeming to accept it; our catching up over drinks and a meal; the prima facie understanding that, and explicit disagreement whether, the nation represents us; my dismissing your promise to pay next time; our promise to text each other; our goodbye; our still being friends. These things are not artefacts (drinks, phones, bills, money), but activities: activities that express and bind subject to subject, that convey higher unities (our country) and divisions (not my country), and that are experienced or lived precisely as such. They are aspects of subjectivity, or what is the same, aspects of subjectivity’s experience of itself. This self-experiencing subjectivity, however, is not Descartes’ meditator or Kant’s apperceptive I. It is just you and I, living our lives out in the open. It is subjectivity as it actually is.

Dan Zahavi makes plain in his eighth single-authored book that phenomenology has always seen this to be subjectivity as it actually is. Indisputably the most prolific scholar of phenomenology, the most prominent contemporary phenomenologist, and the de facto global dean of phenomenology today, Zahavi has been translated into 32 languages. Since the mid 90s, he has been renowned for defending two views. The first is that Husserl, phenomenology’s founder, successfully shows intersubjectivity to be the full form of subjectivity, contra the received (continental) image of Husserl as a solipsist who fails to do justice to the existence of other people, and contra the received (analytic) notion of experiential ‘phenomenology’ as radically private qualia external to our common capacity for intentionality and reference. The second is that there is a minimal self: an embodied, self-temporalizing unity, by which experience is not merely conscious of itself, but unified as ‘one who’ thinks, feels, imagines, etc., a subject of experience. As Zahavi through the 2010s has sought to make explicit, the minimal self is a necessary feature of intersubjectivity. This point is decidedly furthered in Being We: Phenomenological Contributions to Social Ontology.

The book’s aim is simple: to clarify the reality of I, you, and we. So it aims to contribute to social ontology, yet as the ontology of social subjects, not objects, who for Zahavi ought to enjoy a kind of priority in the account. The analytic discourse on collective intentionality and social ontology has since the 90s had John Searle as its most cited theorist. But Searle dismisses phenomenology as irrelevant, opining that phenomenologists “do not have much to contribute to the topics of the logical structure of intentionality or the logical structure of social and institutional reality” (as cited by Zahavi, 1). Zahavi seeks to demonstrate phenomenology’s relevance to the field.

To that end, the book is an overwhelming success, achieved by a chosen focus on how early phenomenology expressly studies collective intentionality and social ontology. That is, while postwar French phenomenologists (Merleau-Ponty, Beauvoir, Sartre, Levinas, Fanon, Thảo, Derrida) have been well-received outside analytic philosophy and across disciplines as continual touchstones for the theory of social reality, they are not even Zahavi’s concern. Zahavi’s primary concern is to show how prewar German phenomenologists have significantly anticipated the ways analytic philosophers frame and pursue the issues. That anticipation is not just because early phenomenology is the 20th century movement in which “intentionality” (Intentionalität) is first coined as the supreme topic of philosophy. It is also because, unbeknownst to most philosophers today, it is a movement in which, as early as 1910, the concept of “social ontology” (soziale Ontologie) is already in use, referring to the descriptive analysis of the reality intended when we interactively and together intend. Early phenomenology—the work of Adolf Reinach, Max Scheler, Edith Stein, Gerda Walther, Edmund Husserl, Alfred Schutz, Aron Gurwitsch, and Kurt Stavenhagen—is exactly what Searle says phenomenology isn’t, and so a hidden treasure.

Yet despite the treasure trove, Zahavi admits that he doesn’t think “one can piece together a comprehensive account of the relation between we, you, and I simply by going through these texts” (4). This is his way of saying that his book, by its comprehensive focus, will be an original work of phenomenology.

Those familiar with Zahavi’s research and institutional impact may be aware of his distinctive platform for naturalizing phenomenology: phenomenology ought to be ‘naturalized’ just in the sense of there being mutual enlightenment between phenomenology and empirical science, even while phenomenology remains committed to essences, if not also to the transcendental—the manner in which subjectivity, especially in its full form as intersubjectivity, is the a priori condition of possibility for objectivity of any kind. Being We succeeds in naturalizing phenomenology to a more groundbreaking degree than any of Zahavi’s works to date, offering countless sites of mutual enlightenment between early phenomenology and discourses across anthropology, history, economics, sociology, psychology, ethology, and social neuroscience. That the book so nimbly bridges these empirical-scientific divides, to furnish a comprehensive new phenomenological theory of we, is one of its more impressive feats.

Whatever its originality, though, Zahavi’s book is no outlier. It marks a high point of emerging work on early phenomenology and social theory over the last two decades: monographs, edited volumes, and special issues (see References below), as well as numerous articles by a younger generation of phenomenologists chiefly in Europe, all to be found in Zahavi’s extensive bibliography. This again is to say nothing of how yet another younger generation of theorists, chiefly in the Americas, are now returning once again to postwar (especially feminist and decolonial) phenomenology for social theory, a subfield now known as critical phenomenology. One hopes that Zahavi’s book spurs these two social-theoretic strands in phenomenology today to engage further.

The book is wonderfully smooth reading, wearing lightly its deep erudition. It has three parts, each building on the last—“We and I”, “We and You”, and “Varieties of We”. Here are the key claims (with a sketch of how Zahavi argues for them), on which the eager philosophical critic might bite:

1) There is no we without me. There is no pre-egoic or anonymous sociality, prior to the differentiation of individuals. The first person singular is an essential feature of intersubjectivity at any level. Althusser and Butler are wrong; Descartes was onto something.

2) Even if we are not, I am. The reality of the first person singular, while fully fledged as a rational, normatively responsive person, has a minimum that is asocial—the ‘minimal self’. On the one hand, Dignāga, Dharmakῑrti, and Śāntarakṣita are wrong: the primitive self-consciousness of experience does entail a self, a primitive ‘one who’, but contra classical Buddhists, there is no need to think of this ‘one’ as an entity behind experience. On the other hand, this self is constitutively independent of the we. (Again, Descartes was onto something.) Every we presupposes an I, but not vice versa.

3) There is no we without you. There is a difference between me seeing him cry, and him seeing me see him cry. The latter is an interaction, albeit one-sided, in which he makes me a you—“you, the one seeing me cry”. By individual address, second-person reality arises, as distinct from the reality of third person observations of behavior. Mere people-watching—anonymous, sans tête-à-tête—begets no we. Only when you face me, or I face you, is it possible for ‘we’ to begin.

4) Interaction is necessary but not sufficient for every we. Philia and mutual eros between two people exemplify the simplest formation of we, a pure we without us. But the minute there is a third interactor, an ‘us’ emerges, the objective or accusative we, which enables plural oppositions (you-alone vs us, me vs you-all) as well as a higher unity of we, namely the group (what we-all decide or want to do). A group, however, is not a subject; corporations are not people. Rather, ‘the group’ is just group-think: a founded intentional mode in which individual (embodied, historically situated) subjects, real people, understand each other. Within a group, there can be individual alienation, where a member does not identify with or feel represented by the group (e.g., the family, the tribe, the nation). The persistence of a group requires some interaction among members but does not require that all members interact all the time, nor that all members have ever met or even know of each other’s existence.

With this fourth claim, Zahavi draws a fascinating normative conclusion. Liberals are wrong that a society is possible in which nobody interacts, and our only bonds are anonymous transactions under the law, and communitarians are wrong that a society is impossible unless everyone interacts, knows and loves each other face to face, and our only bonds are kinship. Communitarianism, a recoil from the malaise of liberalism, begets bad forms of nationalism (and, though Zahavi does not use the word: fascism). Rejecting both liberalism and communitarianism, Iris Marion Young in Justice and the Politics of Difference gets society right, according to Zahavi, describing city life as the model. Accordingly, society is not merely one big home, but a public place in and outside the home, where we encounter not only friends and colleagues but strangers too, a sphere of play, adventure, ambiguity, and difference (192). (The city is also the backdrop of the scene with which this review begins.) One might object that Zahavi’s and Young’s normative conclusion expresses a mere taste for cosmopolity. But an open yet interactive society, whose basis is much love and friendship and also anonymity and the right to be forgotten, a collective that preserves all ways subjects may seek to live, hide, and express themselves—is this not a collective that would affirm self-experiencing subjectivity in all its forms?

Hegel calls spirit (Geist) “the I that is we, the we that is I”; “spirit” is his word, contra Descartes and Kant’s “I”, for self-experiencing subjectivity in all its forms. And here now is the one criticism I will make. While it would be too much to ask for Zahavi to engage extensively with Hegel, it does seem a missed opportunity to not have engaged with Hegel at all. For not only is Hegel a classical and true-blooded advocate of the “equiprimordiality” of I and we, according to which I and we are not merely factually co-occurrent but “constitutively co-dependent” (74). It is also that Hegel’s Geist, the concrete whole whose abstract ‘moments’ are I and we, would be a fair way of explaining transcendental intersubjectivity to someone. Following Husserl, while I can exist without any given we, I cannot exist without the capacity to form a we, as Zahavi himself implies (122). And this capacity on which I depend, coincident with the capacity to have a world at all, is the pre-given we, what Husserl calls “transcendental we subjectivity” (Cartesian Meditations, § 49), the pure, primordial we before differentiation (objectification, quantification) into we versus them. Thus, pace Zahavi, it seems Husserl’s own view is constitutive co-dependence—by which Husserl would join Heidegger (on Mitsein), Merleau-Ponty (on flesh), and Sartre (on consciousness having the full form: being-for-itself-for-Another).