We regularly make implicit welfare comparisons across species. Every year, humans kill billions of nonhuman animals for food production. Countless other animals are neglected during natural disasters such as disease outbreaks, wildfires, floods, and hurricanes. These decisions reflect an ingrained sense of comparative welfare, implying a perceived hierarchy of welfare across species. To systematically assess such practices, we must first determine whether different species have equal or varying capacities for welfare.
The prevailing philosophical view—referred to as the Difference View (DIF)—holds that species with higher cognitive or emotional abilities have a greater capacity for welfare and thus experience higher well-being than those with lower capacities. In Capacity for Welfare Across Species, Tatjana Višak challenges this view. She argues that, despite cognitive or emotional differences, individuals from different species possess the same capacity for welfare—a position she terms the Equality View (EQU). As she puts it: “a happy mouse can in principle be just as well off as a happy human” (85).
The book begins by laying the groundwork for a thoughtful discussion of welfare comparisons across species. In the introduction, Višak offers an overview of the main accounts of welfare, which is especially commendable since many readers will be less familiar with value theory literature. She also outlines the tension between the DIF and EQU positions, making clear her rejection of DIF and defense of EQU. Višak further commits herself to the idea that facts about welfare are directly relevant to what we have reason to do. This means that the discussion of welfare across species will, at least in part, shape our understanding of how we ought to act, making the stakes of the debate both theoretical and practical.
Chapter 2 offers a comprehensive analysis of the various defenses of DIF in the literature. The chapter begins with Shelly Kagan’s view (2019), which relies on an objective list account of welfare. Kagan argues that animals with higher cognitive capacities, like humans, can experience goods such as friendships and achievements, making them generally better off than animals with lower capacities. However, as Višak questions, why would a solitary animal without meaningful relationships be considered worse off than a social animal that engages in them? The absence of certain items from such a contested list does not justify concluding that a being has a lower capacity for welfare—a point, she notes, that is supported both by alternative welfare theories and by non-ad hoc objective list accounts.
The chapter proceeds to examine other supporters of DIF, including Peter Singer’s whole-life preferentialism, John Stuart Mill’s higher and lower pleasures, Jeff McMahan’s concept of fortune, Kevin Wong’s distinction between experiential and absolute welfare, and Mark Budolfson and Dean Spear’s formula. Each is found lacking in the ability to convincingly establish that cognitive and emotional capacities play a decisive role in determining welfare. Višak does not dispute the obvious fact that species vary in their cognitive and emotional capacities. Instead, she questions the relevance of these differences to welfare. As Višak concedes, hers are hardly knock-down arguments against DIF. However, at a minimum, her critique effectively challenges many of the prevailing assumptions in the field.
Chapter 3 presents a defense of EQU. Višak argues that EQU is “at least as plausible as DIF, if not more so” (60). First, EQU is consistent with findings from animal welfare science. For instance, the “five freedoms” account emphasizes freedom from harm and the ability to respond to challenges, aiming for comfort and happiness. Second, EQU aligns with several theories of welfare, including the self-fulfillment account. Whether the focus is on pleasure, happiness, desire satisfaction, self-fulfillment, or need fulfillment, a satisfied pig can, in principle, be just as well-off as a satisfied human. Third, an evolutionary perspective on animal capacities further supports the greater plausibility of EQU. Višak argues that hedonic capacity (a proxy for welfare) is an evolutionary function that aids individuals in choosing beneficial actions. Since pleasure is contingent, transient, and relative to an individual’s available options, this suggests that welfare subjects across different species likely share the same hedonic capacity.
One way to challenge this view would be to highlight how the intensity of pleasure and pain might differ across species. The argument could be made that animals exhibit significant differences in their perceptual abilities, physiology, neural architecture, and cognitive, emotional, and social complexity. Given these variations, it would be unreasonable to expect the intensity of valenced experiences, such as pleasure and pain, to be uniform across all species (Schukraft 2020). After all, even within humans, pain sensitivity can vary significantly (Hu & Iannetti 2019).
In response, Višak might argue that these differences do not necessarily translate into differences in the intensity of valenced experiences. While the sources, processing, and responses to pleasure and pain may vary due to differences in animals’ needs or environments, the fundamental hedonic capacity remains similar across species because it serves the same adaptive function. Some might assume that higher cognitive complexity correlates with a greater intensity of valenced experiences, but this would be misleading. Research shows that cognitive complexity has mixed effects on intensity—some aspects increase it, while others decrease it, which aligns with the idea of equal capacity (EQU). On the other hand, affective complexity, such as emotional depth, appears to expand the intensity range, which might suggest differences across species (DIF) (Schukraft 2020). Clearly, more research is needed to accurately measure the intensity of valenced experiences across species, although this will be a challenging task and not one that Višak pursues in the book. While Višak makes a strong case for an equal capacity for welfare across species, further exploration of the complex issues concerning the intensity of valenced experiences would likely strengthen the argument for EQU.
Chapter 4 extends the discussion to welfare over time. Višak is particularly concerned with the impact of differing lifespans on an individual’s capacity for welfare. After reviewing key philosophical views on the harm of death, Višak focuses on whether species with longer lifespans have a greater capacity for welfare due to their extended lives. One common approach is to relativize welfare to lifespan, suggesting that shorter-lived animals (such as cats) are not necessarily worse off than longer-lived species (such as human beings). However, in a chapter that may require careful attention, particularly for readers new to population ethics, Višak defends the total-duration view, the idea that the longer the life, the greater capacity for welfare. This view implies that, assuming equal and positive welfare at each given moment, cats are indeed worse off than humans.
As Višak acknowledges, this may not be a welcome conclusion, especially for egalitarians and prioritarians. In the spirit of the influential work of Peter Vallentyne (2005), to which Višak does not refer, one might ask: Given that cats (or mice), due to their shorter life expectancy, are, in absolute terms, significantly worse off than humans, should we dramatically shift our concern (and potentially resources) from most humans to most cats? Somewhat unexpectedly, Višak believes we shouldn’t be concerned about that, “since such concern wouldn’t do any good in a world in which there is nothing one can do to prolong the natural life expectancy of cats” (111). However, as Vallentyne suggests, with the possibility of “radical enhancement” (2005:419) of an individual’s welfare capacity irrespective of species, we may be required to enhance those who are less endowed, in this case understood as having a shorter life expectancy, if doing so would improve their overall welfare. While there are ways to avoid this so-called “problematic conclusion” (Vallentyne 2005: 416) it would have been helpful to see Višak explore these implications in more detail.
Chapter 5 concludes with what many readers will likely have been eagerly anticipating: a discussion of the practical implications of EQU. Višak introduces a potential reductio against EQU—the insects-and-climate-change objection. The argument suggests that accepting EQU might lead to promoting climate change, as it could theoretically maximize welfare by bringing about a vast number of insects.
Višak acknowledges that the objection relies on several normative and empirical assumptions that one need not be committed to. Even though Višak believes the book could end at this point, she goes on to explore two key debates that are relevant for this discussion: the question of moral status and the question of whether bringing additional happy lives into existence counts as maximizing welfare.
Regarding the first point, after a thorough review of hierarchical and non-hierarchical views of moral status, Višak concludes that DIF can yield counterintuitive results unless, at some cost in plausibility, it introduces a moral hierarchy that many find implausible. An alternative is to reject DIF in favor of EQU, which maintains equal consideration of interests across species and avoids the need for a hierarchical view of moral status. I find her arguments highly convincing.
Regarding the second point, Višak introduces a concept she refers to as “Baderism” (Bader 2022), a view in population ethics grounded in non-comparativism. If existence and non-existence are not comparable in terms of personal good, bringing about a greater number of well-off insects is not something we have reason to do. This allows Višak to sidestep the reductio and sustain the plausibility of EQU.
Now, whether or not one agrees with Baderism or non-comparativism more generally, there are additional reasons to reject the reductio without necessarily committing oneself to non-comparativism. At one point, Višak suggests that “[s]ince the major benefit to insects is supposed to consist in their larger number, one can wonder whether coming into existence can benefit an individual” (113). Yet, this supposition can be challenged on empirical grounds. Population dynamics suggest that many species follow a highly wasteful reproductive strategy, producing vast numbers of offspring with the expectation that only a few will survive to reproduce (Ng 1995: 270–271). The majority die prematurely and painfully—from predation, freezing, starvation, disease, or parasites—leaving them little or no chance to experience well-being (Ng 1995, Horta 2017, Johannsen 2020, Faria 2023). Insects follow this strategy, so that increasing their population would likely mean bringing more miserable individuals into existence.
Thus, from a comparative perspective, we would lack reasons to promote climate change. Remarkably, the same conclusion holds under a non-comparative view like Baderism, which posits an asymmetry: while we have no obligation to bring happy individuals into existence, we do have a moral reason to avoid bringing miserable individuals into existence (Bader 2022, 35, quoted on 136). Recognizing this would strengthen Višak’s avoidance of the reductio and make her view more likely to be accepted by a wider range of perspectives, both comparative and non-comparative.
One might still question how to apply EQU in practical scenarios. For instance, when faced with the decision of prolonging a human’s or a nonhuman’s life, what should we do? Unfortunately, EQU does not offer specific guidance on such issues. In fact, Višak concedes that the intuition to favor the human is not necessarily in conflict with EQU, since the view concerns only cross-species capacity for welfare. To determine the right course of action, we need to turn to normative ethics.
This may feel somewhat disappointing. While Višak effectively highlights the connection between welfare and normative reasons, the follow-through on how these discussions should influence our behavior remains somewhat limited. One thing is clear: our current tendency to drastically discount nonhuman welfare is largely unjustified. Whether this includes insects and other invertebrates remains an open question for Višak, as it hinges on empirical evidence. Meanwhile, the issue of handling welfare estimates under uncertainty remains unresolved in her framework.
All in all, Capacity for Welfare Across Species is a meticulously argued and ethically significant work. Though some practical questions remain unanswered, it likely stands as one of the most compelling reads of the year.
REFERENCES
Bader, R. M. (2022). ‘The Asymmetry.’ In MacMahan, J., Campbell, T., Goodrich, J., and Ramakrishnan, K. (eds). Ethics and Existence: The Legacy of Derek Parfit, 15–37. New York: Oxford University Press.
Faria, C. (2023). Animal ethics in the wild: Wild animal suffering and intervention in nature. Cambridge University Press.
Horta, O. (2017). Animal suffering in nature: The case for intervention. Environmental Ethics, 39(3), 261–279.
Hu, L., & Iannetti, G. D. (2019). Neural indicators of perceptual variability of pain across species. Proceedings of the National Academy of Sciences, 116(5), 1782–1791.
Johannsen, K. (2020). Wild animal ethics: The moral and political problem of wild animal suffering. Routledge.
Ng, Y. K. (1995). Towards welfare biology: Evolutionary economics of animal consciousness and suffering. Biology and Philosophy, 10, 255–285.
Vallentyne, P. (2005). Of mice and men: Equality and animals. The Journal of Ethics, 9, 403–433.