Chrisoula Andreou is one of the leading contemporary philosophers of rational choice. Choosing Well builds upon her influential articles and book chapters over the last two decades (ix-x).
On a standard model of rational preferences (for short, the “classical model”), formal criteria of completeness and transitivity are both necessary and sufficient for rationality. In what follows, let x, y, etc., be options for choice. “Weak preference”, “strict preference”, and “indifference” are related as follows: x strictly preferred to y if and only if x weakly preferred to y and not y weakly preferred to x; x indifferent to y if and only if x weakly preferred to y and y weakly preferred to x. Transitivity requires: if x weakly preferred to y and y weakly preferred to z, then x weakly preferred to z. (Transitivity thus stated implies transitivity of strict preference, transitivity of indifference, and mixed transitivity, i.e., if x strictly preferred to/indifferent to y and y indifferent to/strictly preferred to z, then x strictly preferred to z.) Completeness requires: either x weakly preferred to y or y weakly preferred to x (or both).
Some philosophical work on rationality challenges the sufficiency component of the classical model—arguing that preferences can be complete and transitive yet irrational (as in a preference for a saucer of mud).[1] Choosing Well contests the classical model from a different direction—challenging its necessity claim. Specifically, it argues first that rational preferences can violate transitivity. Indeed (or so Andreou claims), rational preferences can violate transitivity in the starkest way—via cyclicity of strict preferences. There can be a finite list of options x1… xN, such that an agent rationally strictly prefers xk + 1 to xk for k = 1 to (N−1), yet also rationally strictly prefer x1 to xN. Second, Andreou argues that rational preferences can be incomplete, i.e., have “gaps”. The agent’s rational preferences may be such that, for some two options x and y, the agent neither strictly prefers x to y, nor strictly prefers y to x, nor is indifferent between the two.
In acting on preferences that are cyclic or incomplete, the agent risks engaging in self-defeating behavior. But this possibility does not license the characterization of cyclic or incomplete preferences as irrational:
[R]ationality does not invariably prohibit disorderly [i.e., cyclic or incomplete] preferences, but it does … prompt us to proceed with caution and with a readiness to show restraint, based on an awareness of larger dynamics, when our preferences are disorderly… rationality can validate certain disorderly preference structures while also protecting us from self-defeating patterns of choice. (3)
In the course of defending the rationality of intransitive or incomplete preferences, Choosing Well engages with a rich menu of related topics in the philosophy of choice: self-governance, self-defeating behavior, money pumps, incomparability, rough equality, parity, betterness, satisficing, dynamic inconsistency, resoluteness, temptation, and regret. Andreou’s analysis , throughout, is deep and nuanced. Any serious scholar of rational choice should read Choosing Well.
An important idea that runs through the book is the distinction between “relational subjective appraisal responses” and “categorial subjective appraisal responses”. “Relational subjective appraisal responses rank options in relation to one another; it is these appraisal responses that are captured by the agent’s preferences… By contrast, categorial subjective appraisal responses place options in categories, such as … ‘great’ or ‘terrible’” (7-8). This distinction figures centrally in Andreou’s analysis of rational choice in the presence of cyclic preferences; of what it means for two options to be “on a par”; and elsewhere in Choosing Well.
Andreou defends the possibility of rational cyclic preferences via examples where the cyclic preferences seem perfectly rational. One such example is Warren Quinn’s famous case of the self-torturer (19-20, 49-66). The agent has an electric device with N settings hooked up to their body. At level 1, no current runs through the agent’s body; as the levels increase, the amount of electric current increases. A sufficient increment in the amount of electricity yields increased pain for the agent—and at level N, the pain is excruciating—but the difference in electric current between any two adjacent device settings is sufficiently small to be imperceptible. The agent cares about their pain and about their money. The options x1… xN are such that: with option xk, the device is at level k, and the agent receives (k – 1)D dollars, with D a substantial amount of money (so that increasing the setting from k to k + 1 yields no increase in felt pain but substantially more money).
A second case (which seems identical in relevant respects to the self-torturer case) involves an agent who can indulge in treats up to N times in a year. The agent cares about gustatory pleasure and about health. Having one more treat increases pleasure and has only a trivial health effect; but eating treats N times rather than just once is quite bad for the agent’s health (36-41). In a third case, there are N cups of tea, such that cup k is hotter and less tasty than cup k + 1, with the agent preferring hotter and tastier tea (52-53).
In all three cases, Andreou plausibly suggests, cyclic preferences are intuitively rational: the agent rationally strictly prefers xk + 1 to xk for k = 1 to (N – 1) and yet also rationally strictly prefers x1 to xN. Moreover, she endorses Larry Temkin’s explanation of how rational cyclic preferences can arise, namely, that preferences may rationally take account of some consideration C* in ranking two options that differ merely in degree with respect to some other consideration C, but not if the options differ in kind with respect to C (170). Finally, in an especially illuminating discussion, Andreou shows how some standard critiques of the rationality of cyclic preferences are question-begging.
One such critique is that someone with cyclic preferences could start off with one option and end up with a second that is dominated by the first—that the agent disprefers to the first, starting-point, option. But, given cyclic preferences, every option is dominated by some other. To appeal to the possibility of ending up with a dominated option just begs the question against the proponent of the rationality of cyclic preferences. That the ending-point option is dominated by some other option doesn’t, without more, illustrate that selecting the ending-point option is irrational (53).
Another critique is that an agent with cyclic preferences can be money pumped. Imagine that the agent starts off with x1. Because they prefer x2 to x1, they would be willing to pay some sum of money to a counterparty who offers them x2 instead. They respond similarly when the counterparty offers to trade them x3 for x2…xN for x(N −1) and likewise when the counterparty offers to trade them x1 for xN. Thus, by this series of trades, they end up with x1 minus the aggregate of the sums relinquished by the agent at each exchange. And this is irrational—or so the money-pump critique of cyclic preferences claims.
But what is irrational about starting with x1 and ending up with x1 minus some sum of money? To point out that the second option is dominated by the first just begs the question (once more) against someone who believes that cyclic preferences are rational. Moreover, it makes the money-pump argument a “complicated distraction” (as Andreou observes, 70) in the debate about cyclicity:
[I]f it could be assumed that it is irrational to choose in a way that realizes an alternative to which another is preferred… one would not need to appeal to a susceptibility to being money pumped to conclude that cyclic preferences are irrational. One could simply point out that, even if there is no threat of being money pumped, an agent with cyclic preferences will end up with an alternative to which another is preferred. (70)
On Andreou’s account, what rationality demands of an agent with cyclic preferences is neither that they conform to a norm of acyclicity and rework the preferences nor that they avoid dominated options, but rather that they take account of other norms of rationality. One such norm is to avoid choosing an option that is categorically worse than another—that is, in a lower class of options as defined by the agent’s “categorial subjective appraisal responses” than another available option. In the self-torturer case, the option of excruciating pain and a lot of money is categorically awful, while the option of no pain and no money is not; similarly, in the pleasure and health case, eating loads of treats and becoming unhealthy is categorically worse than eating a few and staying healthy. Appealing to “categorial subjective appraisal responses” helps Andreou not only to explain what rationality requires if cyclic preferences are rational but also to clarify the notion of “self-defeating behavior” in that case:
[W]hen preferences are rationally cyclic, we can… interpret the demand that one avoid realizing a self-defeating pattern of choice as requiring (perhaps among other things) not that one avoid realizing a dispreferred option, since that is not possible, but that one avoid ending up in an unnecessarily low appraisal category (e.g., ending up with a terrible option when great options are available). (8)
Another norm of rationality is to “avoid any alternative that is exactly the same as some other available alternative except for one disadvantageous difference” (71). It is this norm, not the norm of avoiding dominated alternatives, that explains why being money-pumped is irrational.
Turning now to the topic of rationally incomplete preferences: Andreou here builds upon the work of Joseph Raz and Ruth Chang, who have used “small improvement” cases to illustrate rational preference gaps (25, n. 13). In such cases, there are three options: x, y and x+. The agent judges that neither x nor y is better with respect to what they care about, and hence, neither strictly prefers x to y nor strictly prefers y to x. x+ is slightly better than x on one dimension, such that the agent rationally strictly prefers x+ to x. But it seems possible that x+ remains neither better nor worse than y with respect to what the agent cares about. For example, x is having a cup of Pearl Jasmine tea; y is having a cup of Sumatra Gold coffee; x+ is having a slightly more fragrant cup of Pearl Jasmine tea. Assuming the transitivity of betterness, x cannot be equally good as y (else x+ would be better than y). Thus, x is neither better than y nor worse than y nor equally good. Hence, the agent is rational to have a “gap”, neither strictly preferring x to y nor vice versa nor being indifferent (23-28, 73-81).
It is important to underscore that this argument for preference gaps trades upon the transitivity of betterness. And indeed, Andreou explicitly argues that transitivity imposes stronger requirements on betterness than upon preference (109-34).
Andreou agrees with Chang that preference gaps need not involve the incomparability of value. The gap may instead involve “parity”—the two options may be “on a par”, which is different from their being incomparable. She demurs from Chang’s analysis of parity (89) and instead draws upon the pivotal idea of categorial subjective appraisal responses. Andreou proposes that two options are on a par if they are in the same appraisal category and yet not ranked by the agent’s relational subjective appraisal responses, i.e., not seen by the agent as equally good or as one being better than the other (79). Parity, thus understood, is not the same as rough equality (87-90).
Preference gaps, like cyclicity, require the agent to attend to the additional norms of rationality mentioned above. In a small improvement-type case in particular, starting with x+, switching to y, and then switching to x would run afoul of the “disadvantageous difference” norm.
This reviewer, although attracted to the classical model of rational choice—and in particular, by its premise that transitivity of weak preference is rationally required—learned much from grappling with Choosing Well. Two criticisms are perhaps worth voicing. First, Andreou does not address the possibility of “laundering” disorderly (cyclic or incomplete) preferences by choosing a complete and transitive preference structure that respects the disorderly preferences as well as possible and then selecting options by maximizing these laundered, now-classical preferences. Doing so avoids the need to “proceed with caution and with a readiness to show restraint, based on an awareness of larger dynamics, when our preferences are disorderly” (3); it ensures that the agent will not end up in a lower appraisal category than available, will not choose an option identical to a second option except for being worse on one dimension of evaluation, will be dynamically consistent, etc. Is laundering rationally permissible? If not, why not? If so, might it be rationally required (not just permissible), if the risks of proceeding instead with disorderly preferences are large?
Second, Choosing Well does not set forth what Andreou takes to be general truisms about rationality—for example, about the relation between rational preferences and the agent’s judgments of good, about rationality and reasons, or about rationality and the effective pursuit of what the agent cares about. Some such truisms surely lie behind Andreou’s judgments about what is rational with respect to preference cycle and gaps, not merely case-specific intuitions. Setting them out explicitly would have been helpful.
[1] See Brad Hooker and Bart Streumer, “Procedural and Substantive Practical Rationality,” in Alfred R. Mele and Piers Rawling, eds., The Oxford Handbook of Rationality, p. 57, 67-69 (Oxford University Press 2004), discussing such challenges to the classical model.