The core argument of this book is simple and challenging. First, if one cares about core political values such as justice, legitimacy, or the rule of law, then one should attempt to avoid political catastrophe, which is the “loss of the conditions that make justice and political stability possible” (2). Political catastrophe, in turn, is “characterized foremost by a state of extreme material scarcity, in which one can only meet one’s basic needs by denying another (or others) the ability to do the same” (28). Second, climate change increases the risk of political catastrophe, both on a global and a regional scale, to an intolerably high degree (39-42). For example, climate change increases political conflict between and within countries and threatens food scarcity (3, 6-10). Third, because political catastrophe makes the pursuit of any political value impossible, preventing political catastrophe is “of such overwhelming importance that it warrants departures from ordinary moral and legal constraints” (16). Thus, Mittiga argues, unjust, unfair, illiberal, undemocratic, and unlawful political modes of governance might be permissible, and sometimes even required, if they are necessary to prevent a further worsening of the climate crisis.
The three core chapters of the book draw out this argument with respect to justice, legitimacy, and disobedience. Chapter 2 argues that efficacy (in preventing political catastrophe) takes priority over justice, and fairness in particular. Thus, if effectively preventing political catastrophe requires imposing unfair burdens on the current generation or on poorer countries, such as India, then such unfairness must be accepted. Chapter 3 argues that if a government fails to adequately reduce the threat of political catastrophe, then it thereby becomes illegitimate. If authoritarian or illiberal political institutions are the only means to prevent the threat of catastrophe, then they become legitimate (66). (Mittiga remains uncommitted whether the antecedent of this claim is true.) Lastly, Chapter 4 defends climate disobedience as a permissible response to governments’ failure to adequately respond to climate change. Against a mainstream view that sees civil disobedience as fulfilling a primarily “communicative” function, Mittiga argues that climate disobedience is often “harm-preventative”.
Mittiga emphasizes that these results, e.g., the possible legitimacy of an eco-authoritarian regime, are not something that he welcomes but that he warns against (14, 49). Mittiga does not wish to dethrone justice, democracy, or the rule of law. Instead, this is a deeply disappointed, sometimes gloomy, book that sees our ability to achieve our highest political ideals collapsing in the face of our collective failure to stop, or even mitigate, climate change.
We can think of Mittiga’s argument as consisting of two parts: an empirical claim that climate change poses an extremely severe threat to core political values, and a normative claim that significant deviations from ordinary morality are permitted in response to such a threat. I suspect that much of the force of Mittiga’s argument rests on the former, not the latter part. Because Mittiga describes the threat as so severe, it is then relatively straightforward to argue, in a second step, that extreme measures should be taken. After all, the scenario of political catastrophe is “more hellish” than even a Hobbesian state of nature (4): in the latter, mutually beneficial cooperation is absent but possible. But in the face of political catastrophe, mutually beneficial cooperation is not even possible: we are in a zero-sum situation (109) in which many people will perish; the Hobbesian Leviathan cannot get going. I find it plausible that in this scenario, ordinary morality gives out. Furthermore, it seems that in the face of being plausibly threatened by this scenario, significant deviations from ordinary morality are permissible. One might quibble with the details, but I suspect that Mittiga is correct on the big picture in this respect.
I have neither the space nor the expertise to assess whether Mittiga’s depiction of the threats of climate change is correct. Still, one might wonder: what if the threats stemming from climate change are not quite as severe or pressing as Mittiga claims? Climate change might present us with a whole range of dire threats and scenarios that yet fall short of Mittiga’s horrific situation of political catastrophe. In such scenarios, there will be significant conflicts over the distribution of a shrinking surplus of cooperation, and people might be much worse off. If one focuses on such possibilities, then more weight will have to be borne by the normative side of the argument. As an analogy, if the doctor tells you that you will die soon and horribly if you do not change your lifestyle, then there is no question you should make some radical changes, and necessity will dictate what those changes ought to be. But if the threat is not death, but some significant reduction in your quality of life, then issues are not as simple. Perhaps then, there are risks worth taking, costs worth incurring, aspects of your lifestyle worth making sacrifices for. We might still come to the result that you should make radical changes, but a more elaborate weighing of competing goods will be required to come to this result.
It is not immediately clear how to extend Mittiga’s argument to less severe scenarios. His general argument takes the form that, if the conditions for achieving X are threatened, then achieving X needs to take a backseat to safeguarding the necessary conditions for being able to achieve X (e.g., 11). But if the threat is not our inability to achieve X, but a reduced ability to achieve X, or some trade-off between X and other values, then we likely require a more complex account than Mittiga provides. This does not mean that Mittiga’s account is wrong, but that it might be incomplete in important ways.
Let us turn to some of the specifics of Mittiga’s argument. In Chapter 3, Mittiga draws a distinction between “foundational” and “contingent” legitimacy (51-7). The former “requires that citizens’ essential safety needs are met; it is foundational in the sense that no government can be legitimate unless it satisfies this demand” (48). By contrast, following Bernard Williams, Mittiga claims that contingent legitimacy requires that “the power used by the government [...] be, in principle, ‘acceptable’ to all those who are subjected to it” (49). Because contingent legitimacy is tied to acceptability, its precise requirements differ with historical and social context (56). Mittiga then argues that foundational legitimacy enjoys priority over contingent legitimacy. If the former is “about living”, while the latter is about “living well” (59), then it is easy to see how the former enjoys priority over the latter, because clearly one needs to live (at all) to live well. Mittiga invokes other analogies, such as the priorities we set during war and pandemics (14, 58), to bring this point home.
It is not clear to me, however, whether this neat distinction between two types of legitimacy can be upheld. As an analogy, every society contains some level of criminal behavior, social unrest, lack of order, and various other risks. The crucial political question is to which extent these phenomena are acceptable to citizens—a question which would seem to fall in the purview of contingent, not foundational, legitimacy. Similarly, how one construes the threat of climate change, what one considers to be an undue level of risk, and how one should weigh answering this threat vis-à-vis other values would all seem to fall within the notion of contingent legitimacy. This again does not mean that Mittiga’s argument is wrong, but it would likely need substantial amendment.
Another issue concerns the distribution of international responsibility. Regional political catastrophe might happen significantly before global political catastrophe becomes a significant threat. Many of the states that are most threatened by climate change are fragile and underdeveloped and the least capable of preventing or mitigating the threat. Take Bangladesh, a country acutely threatened by climate change. Consider Mittiga’s formula that “a government possesses [foundational legitimacy] if it can and does protect its citizens, and has […] the power and will to continue doing so into the future” (54). Bangladesh’s government might have the will, but not the power, to protect its citizens from the impact of climate change, which would seem to make it illegitimate by this formula. This is a surprising result, especially as it seems to make Bangladesh responsible for a threat it has arguably not caused. It is not clear what Mittiga’s approach would tell us with respect to the legitimacy of international institutions or how states should interact vis-à-vis each other. This is an important and curious lacuna in the light of the global challenge that climate change poses.
Lastly, a few notes on Chapter 4, which addresses civil disobedience. Mittiga is concerned with providing counterexamples to the mainstream “communicative” account of civil disobedience by giving examples of climate activism that have harm prevention as their primary goal but which he thinks should nonetheless count as civil disobedience. I must confess that I am not sure why we should care greatly about this question: why should it matter much whether the label “civil disobedience” is extended to these cases or not? It seems more interesting to ask—but perhaps my tastes here are idiosyncratic—whether the various types of activism, no matter which label we apply to them, are morally justified and if so, on which grounds.
Mittiga implicitly suggests an answer to the justificatory question by commending activists for invoking the “necessity defense” in law, which consists in showing that no reasonable legal alternative existed in preventing some imminent harm (82-3). One obvious problem this justification runs into is the general problem that each particular act of climate protest, perhaps even the collective actions of all contemporary climate activists, seems to not make a difference to climate change. Mittiga’s solution to this problem of causal inefficacy (92-96) rests heavily on adopting Tuck’s (2008) account, without adding much novelty or addressing well-known criticism of this framework (e.g., J. Brennan 2009; G. Brennan 2015; G. Brennan and Sayre-McCord 2015). But even setting these bigger philosophical issues aside, many of the types of activism Mittiga discusses (e.g., 84-5) seem to be cases where climate activists cause only mild and temporary disruptions, which amount to no harm reduction at all. For example, in one case “valve-turners” manage to block “nearly 15 percent of the US’s total crude oil imports [of a single day]” (85); still, this likely just redistributed imports to a different day, is unlikely to have reduced consumption, and probably did not diminish overall oil production.
Compared to the other parts of the book, this chapter’s upshot is also surprisingly modest. After all, if the book’s central argument is correct, and ordinary morality can be set aside in the face of looming political catastrophe, then it would seem that a much wider array of unlawful resistance could be justified, including violence, sabotage, and property destruction. It is surprising, given that Mittiga does not shy away from controversy, that he does not explore these more radical ways of resisting the state.
Overall, this is a challenging book that breaks new ground on an important topic in political philosophy and should open up several important philosophical conversations. It is concise, often engagingly written, and likely to interest a wide audience. In particular, I think the book would work well for undergraduate teaching on any topic having to do with climate change.
REFERENCES
Brennan, Geoffrey. 2015. “Olson and Imperceptible Differences: The Tuck Critique”. Public Choice 164 (3/4): 235–50.
Brennan, Geoffrey, and Geoffrey Sayre-McCord. 2015. “Voting and Causal Responsibility”. In Oxford Studies in Political Philosophy, vol. 1, edited by David Sobel, Peter Vallentyne, and Steven Wall. Oxford University Press.
Brennan, Jason. 2009. “Tuck on the Rationality of Voting: A Critical Note”. Journal of Ethics and Social Philosophy 3 (3).
Tuck, Richard. 2008. Free Riding. Harvard University Press.