Concrete Particulars: A Metaphysics of Spatiotemporal Entities

The manifest picture of reality depicts the world that we inhabit as teeming with concrete particulars, each exhibiting a wide array of qualitative variety. Like the often-mentioned English bulldog Giberman employs as a recurring example throughout the book, my dog is also a notable property-bearer of being a loud snorer. The bulldog and my dog share some properties, such as being a dog, being talked about in this review, and being spatially located, while others not (such as not being a bulldog). The opening and motivating question of Concrete Particulars is this: what ultimately determines that each spatiotemporally located entity has the properties it has and only those rather than others?

Giberman’s book is an extensive nine-chapter defense of a metaphysical answer to this question. He argues that all concrete particulars are, in effect, bundles of tropes, determined by the spatiotemporal distribution of instances of a suigeneris unexplained explainer: markedness. The primitive, yet rich intrinsic nature of instances of markedness and their spatiotemporal and topological configuration are the determinants of all property instantiations and co-instantiations. That is, it is in virtue of distributions of markedness tropes coupled with geometrical constraints that in our world and in any metaphysically possible ones, concrete particulars possess the properties they have and, thus, are the spatiotemporally located entities they are. As Giberman helpfully states in Chapter 1, the key argument of the book can be stated as an argument for positing markedness in virtue of its theoretical benefits:

The best available theories of property exemplification, fundamentality, persistence, and consciousness for spatiotemporally located entities are based on positing markedness; therefore, we have better reason to believe that markedness exists than we do to endorse competing theories of these central philosophical phenomena. (3)

The book can be virtually divided into three parts. Chapters 1 through 3 discuss background methodological issues and situate this metaphysical inquiry in a broader metaphilosophical context, as well as clear the ground for a new bundle theory. Chapters 3 through 6 are devoted to the articulation of Giberman’s package deal of three independent but synergetic views: ‘supertropestantivalism’, ‘ostrich trope theory’, and ‘markedness bundle theory’, which can be characterized as follows:

Supertropestantivalism: the thesis that ‘spatiotemporal regions are numerically identical to complete pluralities of tropes that share their topological and geometric properties, which primitively are internal to them’ (93).

Ostrich trope theory: the view that ‘individual tropes are themselves primitively qualitatively complicated, such that each bears (i) some one relatively natural property, such as a mass, charge, or color, (ii) the power to confer that property onto non-tropes, and (iii) spatiotemporal and topological statuses like spatial size and shape, temporal duration, and spatiotemporal continuity’ (93).

Markedness bundle theory: it is based on ‘(i) a primitive qualitative nature, markedness, and (ii) its spatiotemporal and topological distribution. Both (i) and (ii) are collectively constituted by a plurality (or progression) of markedness tropes, where plurality/progression just is the monadic property markedness’ (134).

The final part, spanning Chapters 7 through 9, demonstrates the theoretical fruitfulness of this markedness-based metaphysics by applying it to three points of hardcore metaphysical contention: fundamentality, persistence, and the mind-body problem. Each chapter is devoted to the defend the following theses, respectively:

Priority Markedness: At every metaphysically possible world that contains concrete objects, the fundamental ones are the maximally continuous markedness tropes (175).

Markedness Plurdurantism: For any material continuant x at arbitrary possible world w, there is some plurality P of fundamental markedness tropes such that P < x at w (that is, ‘P grounds x at w’); for any time t at which x is present at w there is some n such that n ∈ P, n is exactly located at t, and n < the presence and full intrinsic qualitative nature of x at t at w; and for x to persist across interval I: {t1,…, tn} at w is for there to be, for every subinterval m in I, some n such that n ∈ P, n is exactly located at m, and n < the presence and full intrinsic qualitative nature of x at m at w (193).

Markedness panprotopsychism: certain maximally continuous 1-value markedness tropes are responsible for the exemplification of both physically fundamental properties and phenomenal consciousness properties in conscious systems (208).

Throughout Concrete Particulars, Giberman advances sustained arguments against the “prohibitive costs” of competing strategies or approaches and defends his preferred package deal previously cited; it is not possible to articulate its full dialectical force and structure here.

Concrete Particulars is a work of systematic ambition that warrants the attention of anyone invested in contemporary analytic metaphysics—whether or not one is eventually won over by the mechanics of a markedness-based metaphysics. Even the most technical parts, such as the intricate discussion of the topology of markedness (Chapter 6), which aims at illustrating the idea, heuristically presented, that markedness can be regarded as ‘a determinable with exactly two determinate values’, where ‘0-value markedness tropes as functioning like empty regions, locally responsible only for the obtaining of 0-value markedness itself’ and ‘1-value markedness tropes heuristically as possessing the primitive intrinsic nature determinative of bundling all other tropes, given certain local geometric and topological features of the 1-value markedness tropes’ (136), showcase argumentative creativity combined with helpful quotidian examples for illustrating new “tropological” (i.e., regarding the topology of tropes) notions of tabs, maps, strips, and grout.

The monograph serves as a compelling showcase for the explanatory aims of a distinctive metaphysical project: namely, that of defending ‘the best available metaphysics of concrete particulars’ (27). There is, moreover, something intellectually liberating in his approach. Giberman refuses to shy away from a confrontation with the anti-metaphysical skepticism often found in certain quarters of the philosophy of physics and radical naturalism. And it vindicates the legitimacy of questions regarding the nature and working of bundling mechanisms that are both valuable and unresolved by physics, despite being about spatiotemporally located entities.

Given the argumentative density expressed throughout the book, we should expect many points potentially subject to critical discussion. While many specific threads merit closer inspection, I will confine my attention to two areas which triggered my philosophical curiosity. I choose these because Concrete Particulars is, at heart, a study about a metaphysics of fundamental properties. Thus, it strikes me as appropriate to raise one point about fundamentality and another about properties.

Giberman correctly distinguishes between physical and metaphysical conceptions of fundamentality beginning in Section 2.3, and he carefully specifies various ways of understanding ascriptions of fundamentality to categories versus elements of those categories. However, the reader is left wondering how exactly we should understand the fundamentality of markedness, which takes the spotlight in Chapter 7. One might wonder, for instance, whether priority markedness is neutral with respect to how we interpret the fundamentality of (some) tropes. Giberman appeals to the notion of an ‘unexplained explainer’ (164) to illustrate the idea of fundamental markedness. Yet, throughout the chapters, it becomes apparent that not every conception of fundamentality will be consistent with priority markedness. Giberman emphasizes that priority markedness ought to be compatible with unending structures or mereological complexity even at the fundamental level. Thus, fundamentality cannot be taken as a matter of metaphysical independence (or ungroundedness) or mereological simplicity since markedness tropes are claimed to be fundamental even in such non-foundationalist scenarios.

Perhaps, priority markedness is best coupled with a Lewisian inspired notion of fundamentality, such as that of perfect naturalness (Lewis, 1983) or completeness (Lewis, 1986). Yet the connection between priority markedness and these ways of understanding fundamentality is not transparent in the book. The simplicity of Lewisian perfectly natural properties is presumably distinct from the simplicity of fundamental markedness tropes, given the complex architecture of the latter. Thus, one should expect a deviation from the Lewisian position.

There are two further risks pertaining to completeness. First, as Bennett (2017) proved, completeness is equivalent to metaphysical independence. Consequently, this view faces the problem of ruling out non-foundationalist scenarios again. Second, even if it is possible to prize apart completeness and metaphysical independence (e.g., Leuenberger, 2020), the resulting notion might not capture the determinative sense in which the fundamental markedness tropes build or construct the non-fundamental spatiotemporally located entities. For example, the recognition of a supervenience relation between the fundamental basis’s tropes and the non-fundamental entities ensures a dependency of the latter upon the former, but it does not automatically establish that the fundamental tropes determine the non-fundamental entities. To ensure the required determination, it seems that an explicit metaphysical determination relation, such as grounding, is needed. Yet, grounding is not the only candidate notion, and Giberman remains explicitly liberal regarding the precise understanding of the idea of metaphysical determination (22-23). The reader is left wondering about what determinative relation could perform the job suitably. Perhaps, fundamentality is another primitive to be added in the markedness-based metaphysics package deal of primitives.

Another domain of interest concerns the qualitative nature of markedness tropes. Giberman writes, for example:

The distinctive qualitative character of markedness is sui generis, intrinsic to markedness tropes, and uniquely responsible for the fact that markedness tropes determine the bundling of other kinds of tropes. (…) The distinctive qualitative character of markedness bears this unique responsibility for bundling just as the distinctive qualitative character of mass is uniquely responsible for the fact that its instances resist acceleration, and the distinctive qualitative character of a red quale is uniquely responsible for that quale’s phenomenal content. (11)

He continues, ‘What exactly is the intrinsic qualitative character of markedness like? I leave that question open’ (ibid.). For those engaged with the technical debates surrounding the qualitativity of properties, Giberman’s metaphysics suggests a compelling, if yet underexploited, research frontier: connecting the metaphysics of markedness with the discussion surrounding the qualitativity of properties. Recent developments in the investigation of powerful qualities, fundamental properties that are claimed to be at once responsible for the qualitative character of their bearers and their causal powers (e.g., Heil, 2003; Martin, 2007), appear to display a superficial affinity for the metaphysics of markedness. Powerful qualities, like markedness tropes, have a non-simple internal structure, although proponents of this view disagree on how exactly we ought to envision the architecture of such properties (e.g., Giannotti, 2019; Williams, 2019; Azzano, 2020; Livanios, 2020; Tugby, 2020; Kimpton-Nye, 2021; Taylor, 2023). And powerful qualities, like markedness tropes, are responsible for the qualitative similarity and dissimilarity among its bearers. Thus, one immediate question is whether the initial affinity between the markedness metaphysics and the powerful qualities view not only is worth exploring in more detail but also warrants further scrutiny, specifically whether such an intersection could illuminate the elusive notion of a property’s qualitativity.

All in all, Concrete Particulars is a rich study in metaphysics. It is distinguished by its argumentative creativity and ambitious explanatory goals. I urge potential readers to look past the lexical intimidation of terms like ‘Supertropestantivalism’ and engage with Giberman's systematic framework. Only through such engagement can one judge whether this self-described ‘best available metaphysics of concrete particulars’’ truly delivers on its ambitious promise.