Alexander of Aphrodisias is the most influential—and most polarizing—ancient interpreter of Aristotle. His account of the human soul was a notorious target of criticisms (and invectives) throughout the centuries, but some hailed his as the most authentic, sober ancient version of Aristotelianism. The latter tendency has become more and more dominant since the mid-20th century. And recent decades witnessed a heyday of specialized Alexander-studies. It is thus rather surprising that the latest monograph on Alexander’s account of intellect (nous) was—until recently—Paul Moraux’s 1942 dissertation, in many respects still informed by the Medieval view of Alexander as a perverter of Aristotle’s thought. Alexandra Alván León’s new book (also a reworked dissertation defended in 2023 at Universität Münster) is a welcome correction to this state of affairs.
Given the stated goal of providing the first “up-to-date systematic interpretation of Alexander’s account of intellect” (5), it may surprise the reader that the first full half of the book focuses not on intellect but on the “essence of the soul”. This apparent detour, though, is well justified: human intellect is “the most perfect soul-capacity” (5), and in order to understand it, we need to know what, according to Alexander, a soul-capacity is, how it relates to the body (Chapter 1), and how a plurality of capacities can be integrated within a single soul (Chapter 2).
The first half of Chapter 1 is a close reading of Alexander’s De Anima 2.25-11.5—a dense text which sets the hylomorphic view of the soul as the form of a body against the background of a general conception of how higher forms “result from”, “supervene upon”, or “follow” lower ones. Alván León argues against interpretations that “weaken” the role of the form by ascribing to Alexander a non-Aristotelian reductionist materialism. All talk of a form’s “coming to be” on Alexander’s part should be understood in terms of conceptual derivation and/or dependence on matter as a necessary condition. Here, Alván León extends her criticism to the “emergentist” interpretation[1] and insists that the underlying matter is, according to Alexander, not a sufficient condition for the form (31-32 n. 87; 39 n. 107; 47 n. 131).
Now, if Alexander accepted covariation (cf. summetaballein at Mant. 1, 104.27-24), as Alván León acknowledges (31-32 n. 87; 47 n. 131; 48), it becomes less than clear in which sense exactly the underlying matter fails to be the sufficient condition of the form’s existence. An emergentist would, of course, grant that the form is not a causal consequence of matter. Perhaps the point is that nothing of form F can come to exist without there already being a bearer of F responsible for F “coming to be in something else” (Metaph. VII 8 1033b5-8; cf. 31-32). This additional condition is surely not implied by emergentism, but it doesn’t seem incompatible with it, either.
The second half of Chapter 1 focuses on the consequences Alexander draws from his general hylomorphism for the specific case of the soul. Alván León discusses Alexander’s disambiguation of the way in which the soul is “in” the body (An. 11.14-17.8 and Quaest. I 26); his dialectical justification of the soul’s incorporeality, inseparability from the body, and immovability (An. 17.9-26.30); as well as his understanding of the limited but important role of the “most general account” of the soul provided in Aristotle’s An. II 1.
Chapter 2 focuses on how, in Alexander’s view, each of the three main kinds of souls (nutritive/generative, perceptive, and rational) succeeds in uniting a plurality of soul-capacities. In order to tackle this task, Alván León introduces two sets of conceptual distinctions: first (drawing on Alexander’s commentary on Metaphysics V 12), a distinction between active capacities, passive capacities, hexeis and apatheiai; and second, a distinction between three kinds of integration—namely, interlacing (Aneinanderbinden), sublation (Aufhebung), and convergence (Konvergenz). By applying these two conceptual frameworks to Alexander’s account of the soul, Alván León shows that souls, in Alexander’s view, are more complex structures than one could have thought. Indeed, it is argued that they involve all three kinds of integration and all four kinds of capacities.
For the overarching topic of the book, the most important claim of Chapter 2 is that the complexity of the rational soul is mirrored by the internal structure of the thinking capacity (nous) itself (115). Two kinds of complexity are distinguished here. First, the duality of desiderative-impulsive and discriminative-critical functions is integrated in a sublated way as practical and theoretical aspects of nous. (This is argued to be similar to how the generative capacity integrates the functions of “reception” and “production”, separated from each other in nutrition and growth, respectively.)
Second, “all other discriminative soul-capacities” are integrated in nous by way of convergence, “so that nous is the complete discriminative capacity which discriminates and cognizes all objects” (121). Although it is not entirely clear how these two kinds of complexity map onto the discussion of the remaining chapters, they clearly prepare the ground for what comes through as the central claim of the book as a whole—namely, that the human thinking capacity is, in Alexander’s view, a more complex entity than has been recognized by scholars.
Crucial for the second part of the book becomes complexity “with respect to energeia”, implying that the human thinking capacity has three “constitutive factors”: the material, the habitual, and the actual (or productive) nous. While this tripartition is familiar from Alexander’s De Anima and De Intellectu (and seems to have deeper Peripatetic roots), it is standardly understood in terms of three stages of development. This, Alván León argues, is a misunderstanding. The tripartition captures, first and foremost, a stable internal structure of the thinking capacity: any development of nous “is only possible insofar as all three factors are simultaneously present and active (tätig)” (128). Chapters 3-5 go through the three “constitutive factors” one by one.
Chapter 3 provides a painstaking analysis of the materiality of “material” nous—one of the notorious issues in the Aristotelian tradition from Theophrastus to Averroes, and beyond. Alván León emphasizes the contrast drawn by Alexander between the materiality of nous and the physical matter, while resisting the idea that materiality would be applied to nous merely homonymously or metaphorically. She finds a common ground in the notion of “potentiality as possibility”. For the overall argument, the most important upshot is the “passivity” of material nous, implying that it is unable to think anything without “an active actualizing nous” (137, 147, 152).
This is one of the places where Alván León’s synthetic approach to Alexander’s De Anima and De Intellectu comes to the foreground. The dependence on “an active actualizing nous” is, indeed, emphatically stressed throughout De Intellectu, while in De Anima nothing like this is—notoriously—introduced until very late in the argument, and it is not obvious whether this factor is needed by the account in the same sense as it is in De Intellectu. I believe that Alván León is right in resisting the widespread tendency to treat the two accounts as radically different. But more scholarly work deserved consideration in this context—especially on Alexander’s notion of noetic receptivity in De Anima, which may seem to largely bypass the need of “an active actualizing nous”.[2]
Chapter 4 begins with a nuanced differentiation of the “habitual intellect” from what Alexander calls the “common” or “natural” intellect (shared by all adult humans), which is more of an intermediate stage, presupposed by but not guaranteeing the development of the habitual intellect (characteristic of experts). It also contains a discussion of Alexander’s notoriously tricky view on universals as objects of thought. But the most original claim of this chapter is the idea that the habitual intellect is not just a stage of intellectual development but a productive “constitutive factor” of every thinking capacity—its “constitutive reflexivity” (204). This is far from obvious because the two relatively brief passages in Alexander’s De Anima (85.10-86.6) and De Intellectu (107.21-29) that are dedicated to habitual intellect don’t say it is a constitutive factor, nor do they ascribe any productivity to it.[3] Rather, habitual intellect is described here as the result of the separation of forms from matter and the grasp of universals (where separating and grasping, as Alván León convincingly argues, seem, for Alexander, to be two sides of the same event).
Alván León doesn’t deny this, but she treats the habitual intellect at the same time as the subject of the separation, so that it “actualizes” (191)—or indeed “produces” (192)—itself. This autopoietic activity of the habitual intellect is then fleshed out on the basis of the account of noetic production from De Intellectu B2 (although this text doesn’t quite mention the “habitual intellect”) and interpreted in terms of demonstrative and dialectical arguments: the former starting from an already acquired grasp of a form, the latter preparing for and leading to such a grasp. I find the proposal that, on Alexander’s view, dialectical arguments play a crucial role in any actual transition from common to habitual intellect convincing—independently from the question of whether it corresponds to “production” in terms of De Intellectu (or De Anima) and, even more specifically, whether “habitual” intellect is the subject of this “production”.
Chapter 5 begins by a succinct analysis of one outstanding feature of Alexander’s noetics: his systematic avoidance of the adjective “passive” when speaking of intellect. This avoidance on the level of vocabulary manifests a deeper philosophical commitment—namely, Alexander’s reliance on the concept of thought as “identity between subject and object”, which seems to leave no room for the original Aristotelian analysis of thought as a way of being affected (paskhein) by the object of thought. The core of Chapter 5, though, focuses on the notorious question of how the so-called “productive intellect” produces human thinking. As often, Alván León interprets the account of Alexander’s De Anima and that of De Intellectu together. She argues that the productive intellect “produces” thinking in the material intellect by way of being material intellect’s ultimate telos—but a telos that must already exist in actuality. Moreover, she argues that in order to play this role, the productive intellect must “always be in us” (223). In this way, Alván León rejects the traditional—virtually unanimous—view according to which Alexander identifies the productive intellect responsible for our thinking with the Unmoved Mover, external to us.[4] The Unmoved Mover, to be sure, is a productive intellect but not the one responsible for our thinking (231). Rather, each human soul contains its own productive intellect, as the factor of “spontaneity” constitutive of every thinking capacity. Human thinking is thus a “spontaneous self-actualization” (224).
Alván León is well aware that this suggestion will sound surprising to most readers, and in the last two sections of Chapter 5, she addresses some of the anticipated concerns. She argues convincingly that the notion of “intellect from without” does not itself necessarily point to any transcendent, let alone divine, intellect: it can be understood in the original embryological context of GA II 3 as a claim about thinking not being explicable by “material processes” (229). Similarly, Alexander’s description of the productive intellect as “separate” (khōristos) need not mean existing separately from the soul; it can mean being “independent from matter” (236). (Would Alexander be ready to ascribe this kind of independence to a “constitutive factor” of human nous? I have doubts. Perhaps his comments on possible meanings of khōristos reported by Philoponus (In An. 521.11-26; Int. 58.70-96) would provide a more promising response here.)
Other concerns remain, both exegetical and philosophical. Exegetically, some passages just seem hard to reconcile with the “immanentist” interpretation. Here is one example:
It is the intellect said to be ‘from without’, the productive, not being a part or power of our soul, but coming to be in us from outside whenever we think of it... Being such, it is, reasonably, separate from us…” (Mant. 2 108.22-26; cf. e.g. An. 88.5-7)[5]
One of the philosophical concerns is that it seems very difficult to align Alexander’s identification of “intellect from without” as an “intellect in activity” with the original embryological context of GA II 3. Theophrastus who did interpret “intellect from without” within this context emphasized that it must be intellect in the sense of “an underlying capacity/potentiality”. And for a reason: how could an activity of thinking take place in an embryo—apparently even before it becomes capable of perceiving and nourishing itself? This just sounds too paradoxical and incompatible with Aristotle’s epigenetic commitment (“the end is only realized at the final stage of generation”, GA II 3, 736b3-4).
Alván León’s book provides a fresh and thought-provoking systematic interpretation of Alexander’s difficult but rewarding and greatly influential account of the thinking capacity of the soul. It is commendable that this endeavor is not limited to Alexander’s De Anima but takes systematically De Intellectu into consideration, too (extending the focus to preserved reports on Alexander’s commentary on Aristotle’s De Anima could have further profited the study). The reader need not agree with Alván León’s (often radical) proposals to find her book rewarding and inspiring. Thorough analyses of key primary texts, combined with a courage to explore untrodden interpretative paths, make this book rewarding reading for anyone interested in Alexander’s psychology and metaphysics.
REFERENCES
Alexander of Aphrodisias, An. = De anima, ed. I. Bruns, Alexandri Aphrodisiensis praeter commentaria scripta minora(Commentaria in Aristotelem Graeca, suppl. 2.1), Berlin: Reimer, 1887.
Alexander of Aphrodisias, Mant. = De anima libri mantisa, ed. R. W. Sharples, Alexander Aphrodisiensis, "De anima libri mantissa": A new edition of the Greek text with introduction and commentary (Peripatoi 21), Berlin: de Gruyter, 2008.
Alexander of Aphrodisias, Quaest. = Ἀπορίαι καὶ λύσεις, ed. I. Bruns, Alexandri Aphrodisiensis praeter commentaria scripta minora (Commentaria in Aristotelem Graeca, suppl. 2.2), Berlin: Reimer, 1892.
Aristotle, An. = De anima, ed. A. Förster, Aristotelis de anima libri III, Budapest: Academia litterarum hungarica 1912.
Aristotle, Metaph. = Metaphysia, ed. W.D. Ross, Aristotle's Metaphysics, 2 vols. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1924.
Aristotle, GA = De generatione animalium, ed. H. J. Drossaart Lulofs, Aristotelis de generatione animalium. Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1965.
Philoponus, In An. = In Aristotelis libros de anima commentaria, ed. M. Hayduck, Ioannis Philoponi in Aristotelis de anima libros commentaria (Commentaria in Aristotelem Graeca 15), Berlin: Reimer, 1897.
Philoponus, Int. = De intellectu, ed. G. Verbeke, Jean Philopon: Commentaire sur le De anima d’Aristote, traduction de Guillaume de Moerbeke, Louvain: Publications universitaires de Louvain, 1966.
V. Caston, Alexander of Aphrodisias: On the Soul. Part I, London 2012.
M. Tuominen, “Receptive Reason: Alexander of Aphrodisias on Material Intellect”, Phronesis, 55.2 (2010), 170–190.
G. Guyomarc’h, “Alexander of Aphrodisias and the Active Intellect as Final Cause”, Elenchos 441 (2023), 93–117.
D. Papadis, ‘“L’intellect agent” selon Alexandre d’Aphrodise’, Revue de Philosophie Ancienne, 9.2 (1991).
D. Papadis, Die Seelenlehre bei Alexander von Aphrodisias, Bern 1991.
[1] For which, see especially V. Caston, Alexander of Aphrodisias: On the Soul. Part I, London 2012.
[2] See especially M. Tuominen, “Receptive Reason: Alexander of Aphrodisias on Material Intellect”, Phronesis, 55.2 (2010), 170–190. Cf. G. Guyomarc’h, “Alexander of Aphrodisias and the Active Intellect as Final Cause”, Elenchos 441 (2023), 93–117.
[3] Not even at An. 85.25 where poiein touto (“touto” is omitted at p. 187) can mean “doing this” (as e.g. Accattino and Donini understand it) – perhaps in the sense of contemplating the universal – rather than “producing” anything.
[4] The only exception seems to be D. Papadis, ‘“L’intellect agent” selon Alexandre d’Aphrodise’, Revue de Philosophie Ancienne, 9.2 (1991), 133–151; and Die Seelenlehre bei Alexander von Aphrodisias, Bern 1991.
[5] Where intellect, which is essentially in activity, seems to be sharply contrasted with “intellect in us”. None of these passages is, as far as I can say, discussed in the book (it would have been easier to find out if the book contained an index locorum).