Disappearing Ink: Essays in Early Modern Philosophy

In his preface to this volume of Eileen O'Neill's collected essays, Gary Ostertag notes two book projects that O'Neill discussed writing: one on occasional causation in early modern philosophy, and a second collecting her essays. This is that second project, essays gathered together by Ostertag. Even for one who has read each of O'Neill's essays through the years, and who came to appreciate every one of those essays as masterful blends of creative and rigorous thought, reading thirteen of O'Neill's papers together leaves a striking impression. For across topics such as causation (including occasional causation), mind-body interaction, historiography, feminism, and more, O'Neill brings a consistent blend of exhaustive scholarship, attunement to historical context, analytic rigor, and the curiosity and courage^[1] to broach new topics or to place old ones under new lights. O’Neill was among a small handful of philosophers at the vanguard of a project to bring the philosophical contributions of early modern European women to light, and her tireless work on this front has changed, for the better, our historical understanding of the discipline. O'Neill's impact has been immense.

In his introduction to the volume, Ostertag offers a helpful trio of themes that weave through the papers and that interact with one another in exciting ways: feminist historiography, the equality of the sexes, and causation.

O'Neill's interest in feminist historiography was spurred by the erasure of women from histories of early modern European philosophy, the phenomenon captured by the title of her extraordinary essay “Disappearing Ink: Early Modern Women Philosophers and Their Fate in History” (3-47). Following an “exhausting bibliographic and doxographic overview of seventeenth- and eighteenth-century women philosophers” meant to “overwhelm” the reader and emphasize the magnitude of the “problem of women's virtual complete absence in contemporary histories” (21), O'Neill goes on to identify reasons (both internal and external to philosophy) for this erasure. She then turns to the challenge of how to move forward given this state of affairs, thinking through historiographical approaches that are up to the task of recovering the philosophies of women in this period of European history. Acknowledging that the “historiography of philosophy is an important and thorny subject” (29), O'Neill provides a way forward, and her contributions to feminist historiography grow and deepen as she broaches the topic in about half the papers in this volume.

Among the myriad of directions from which O'Neill broaches the topic of historiography, Ostertag helpfully notes three historiographical approaches that arise repeatedly in these essays: rational reconstruction, Geistesgeschichte, and historical reconstruction. Rational reconstruction, in O’Neill’s view, “attempts to state, in our own contemporary terms, the philosophical problems of past philosophers that continue to be problems for us, and the significance of the contributions to their solutions made by past philosophers” (83). Geistesgeschichte, as Ostertag puts it, is “a philosophical history…positing an endpoint or telos shaping the philosophical doctrines leading towards it…[and taking] a pluralistic approach” to possible philosophical narratives (xxi). And historical reconstruction is when “we take as central those issues deemed by the philosophers of the past to be the central ones; and [when] we…count past figures to be philosophers just in case they were so deemed by their contemporaries” (105; I return to this below). O'Neill's own approach, as Ostertag argues, combines the latter two options, drawing upon historical reconstruction to keep “the historian honest”, and utilizing Geistesgeschichte to give a “proper history of philosophy [which] also requires a guiding narrative” (xxii).

And what a powerful method this is in O'Neill's able hands. As one example, let us take the second theme Ostertag notes: the equality of the sexes. In “Cartesianism and the Gendered Mind: Poullain’s On the Equality of the Two Sexes and Lambert's New Reflections on Women”, O'Neill brings an exquisitely nuanced historical command to interpreting the texts of François Poullain de la Barre and Anne Thérèse de Lambert. One aim is to interrogate the late twentieth-century theory that early modern Europe saw a “gendering of cognitive abilities” (273), which associated women with “sensory and emotion-infused thought” and men with “thought about purely intelligible objects” (274), and that Cartesianism contributed to this association. This theory, in the hands of some philosophers of the late twentieth-century, is an example of rational reconstruction.

But as O'Neill shows, a close historical reconstruction of Poullain’s and Lambert's thought complicates and significantly undermines this theory. For Poullain, as a Cartesian, argues for the equality of the sexes with regards to cognitive abilities given the immaterial, unsexed nature of the soul (275-281). And Lambert also argues against women's supposed diminished rational capacities (282-290). So, alongside her attention to historical context, O'Neill also develops a narrative (drawing on Geistesgeschichte), compellingly showing that

the evolving views about cognition and gender in their [Poullain’s and Lambert’s] texts give us some insight in the movement from Descartes’s ungendered mind to Rousseau’s complementarity picture of cognition (275)

according to which men and women cognize in different, and complementary, ways.

This example also connects with O'Neill's interests in causation, in this case mind-body causation. For while it is true that Poullain's starting point is the unsexed—because immaterial—soul, such a soul is nonetheless unified with a sexed body, and the causal interaction in that union has an effect on the soul. This is treated differently by different thinkers in early modern European philosophy. For Malebranche, for example, “female bodies may disrupt the mind's capacity for performing deductions and for grasping first truths” (281). But as O'Neill shows, this is not the only direction taken by philosophers in this era. It is here where Lambert's writing offers ways of accommodating the causal impact of sexed bodies on unsexed souls in a way that does not conclude with a claim about the supposed limitations of women's rational capacities.

O'Neill's interests in causation extend well beyond how the mind-body union problem, and the role of causation therein, plays into issues related to gendered cognitive capacities. Two of her earliest papers shed new light on topics central to the metaphysics of causation as treated by philosophers at the core of the early modern European philosophical canon, as it was understood before O'Neill and a small handful of others started the cascade of work that has expanded our ways of thinking about this period. In “Mind-Body Interaction and Metaphysical Consistency: A Defense of Descartes” (155-174), O'Neill utilizes her analytic prowess to move forward our thinking about Descartes’ understanding of mind-body interaction alongside his broader causal commitments. In “Influxus Physicus” (175-203), O'Neill provides an historically broad and philosophically rich account of the theory of “physical influence” to illuminate ideas found in Leibniz, among others. Some of O'Neill's later papers extend her interests in the metaphysics of causation found in these early papers to help us better understand how Margaret Cavendish (Chapters Nine and Ten) and Mary Astell (Chapter Eleven) think about causation in general, and how the theory of occasional causation is handled by these two philosophers.

Ostertag's introduction does a wonderful job of identifying core themes, discussed above, that run through much of O'Neill's philosophy. Building on that work, here are two more themes in O’Neill’s writings, both of which have seen significant interest in recent scholarship on Early Modern European philosophy, and both of which promise to advance the field in exciting ways. One theme surrounds possible pitfalls surrounding historical reconstruction, pitfalls O'Neill grapples with when thinking through the subtleties of a feminist historiography. Take the description of historical reconstruction quoted above: “…we…count past figures to be philosophers just in case they were so deemed by their contemporaries” (105). O'Neill recognizes the potentially fraught nature of this approach: “For, we might wonder whether the category of philosopher was gendered as masculine in the past, or at least in the early modern period” (145).

Historical reconstruction takes seriously the historical context in which ideas are forged. But the historical context that was—and to a certain degree, still is—carried forward and remembered was a narrow one indeed, and for well over a century, it included no women. This context shaped—and to a certain degree, still shapes today—the accepted characteristics of the philosopher. A key element to moving forward is to take our historical contexts as always provisional and always open to expansion. O'Neill's work, as evidenced in this volume, is an excellent example of this sort of expansion, and how powerful it can be in leading to increasingly better histories. One element of a more expansive historical context, for example, is what I take to be her recognition that historical actors, no less than contemporary actors, are merely human with human limitations. This is captured in her attempt to address the challenge of determining who might have been considered a philosopher in the past, for example, when she writes that a productive historiography “would also include figures and issues that would have been taken to be philosophically important in the past had there not been systematic prejudice at work” (96).

A second additional theme picks up on this systematic prejudice and how it skews views about the nature of philosophy itself. O'Neill repeatedly brings this up throughout her essays when she identifies philosophical topics of interest to some women philosophers (for example, those that center theology), and genres and methods that some women sometimes use to convey their philosophy. That some women philosophers embraced these topics, genres, and methods was among some of the reasons why they have been excluded from our histories. On this, O'Neill plumbs deep and difficult territory, inviting the reader to think about the nature of philosophy, while being mindful of the potential dangers of gatekeeping which, for so long, kept women’s contributions out of our histories. For while surely not everything is philosophy, Early Modern European women often broached recognizably philosophical topics in genres and using methods more difficult for the contemporary analytic philosopher to recognize as philosophy. Wrestling with the line between what is and is not philosophy, while being mindful of the potential dangers related to this work, is at the core of some very interesting scholarship currently underway, and O’Neill’s early writings on these issues laid foundations for this current scholarship.

Eileen O'Neill produced first rate philosophy in some core areas of early modern European thought, such as Descartes on causation. She could have continued with this work alone, the easier route, the path of least resistance. But she chose a harder route, striking a new path, with all the extra work and reward that such a path could bring. As she concludes her essay, “Justifying the Inclusion of Women in Our Histories of Philosophy: The Case of Marie de Gournay”:

…feminist historians of philosophy, with our acceptance of gender issues as constituting an important set of philosophical concerns, and with our openness to exploring different styles and genres of philosophy, are in an excellent position to excavate many of the women's long-forgotten texts, and to demonstrate the philosophical contributions that they make. The work will be hard, but the payouts may just change the shape of our picture of Western philosophy. (125)

With all that has happened in the years since she penned those lines, it is fair to say that those ambitious payouts are being realized, and O’Neill was pivotal in bringing a newly shaped picture of Western philosophy. Lisa Shapiro wrote of her: “Hers was a field of dreams—if you build it, they would come. And she was right. She played the long game” (on Eric Schliesser’s blog, digressions&impressions; cited by Ostertag, xiii). Eileen’s personal generosity with colleagues (Mercer, viii), and notably, with younger colleagues just starting out, is one reason why many of us did join in the wonderful thing she was building. Another reason is the urgency and the beauty of the work.