What are the texts presented in this book? Sebastian Purcell says he “set out to translate these Huehuetlatolli or Discourses of the Elders, which Friar Andrés de Olmos compiled beginning around 1535” (xi). He explains that the huehuetlatolli was a genre which belonged to the Nahuatl-speaking peoples of pre-Hispanic central Mexico, consisting of discourses (tlatolli) pronounced by elders (huehuetque) and the brief responses given by the younger listeners who heard them. Purcell later notes (xl) that Olmos, a Franciscan missionary in Mexico, included examples of eloquent speech at the end of the grammar of Nahuatl he completed in 1547. The surviving manuscripts of Olmos’ grammar do indeed contain such examples in short quotations, usually of one or two sentences, which in total take up only a few pages.
But this English translation runs to more than 130 printed pages, comprising 29 full and extensive orations and responses to them, along with a shorter miscellany of texts that Purcell has entitled “Social Role Descriptions”. All that primary material really comes from other sources: the orations and responses which make up the greater part of it are a translation of "Huehuetlahtolli [sic]", a collection of Christian preceptive discourses in Nahuatl published by another friar, Juan Bautista (or “Baptista”) around 1601, more than thirty years after Olmos’ death. The shorter miscellany then provided by Purcell is of excerpts from three further works of missionary literature: Col[l]oquios y Doctrina c[h]ristiana (1564), a bilingual resource for preachers originally composed in Spanish and then translated into Nahuatl; the Florentine Codex (c. 1580), an encyclopedic study of pre-Hispanic society and belief compiled in Nahuatl, and its prototype, the Primeros memoriales (c. 1558–1560). All three of these works were overseen by another missionary friar, Bernardino de Sahagún. The “Social Role Descriptions” extracted from these works, therefore, have nothing to do with Olmos at all.
Bautista’s Huehuetlahtolli cannot be firmly attributed to Olmos, although Purcell disingenuously implies this. He only states towards the close of his introduction (xli, l) that his English translation is of Bautista’s volume, and he ascribes its fundamental content to Olmos without giving any grounds for doing so, affirming that Bautista published it “after interpolating a few points and adding a few speeches at the end of the work”. Bautista himself said nothing about where the Nahuatl texts he published came from, or who compiled or composed them.
There is, however, a basis for linking the Nahuatl texts in Bautista’s collection to Olmos which is worth considering. As a kind of coda to his Huehuetlahtolli Bautista reproduced chapter 223 of the Apologética historia sumaria (c. 1558) by Fray Bartolomé de las Casas, the Dominican chronicler and “Defender of the Indians”—this part of Bautista’s volume has not been included in Purcell’s English translation. The chapter contained Spanish translations from Nahuatl of four preceptive speeches, each paired with a shorter reply from the addressee —and Las Casas revealed in the chapter (this was also reprinted by Bautista) that Olmos had sent him those translations. The first two translated speeches incorporated by Las Casas turn out to be condensed versions of the initial pair of speeches Bautista presented in Nahuatl (the address of a father to his son and the son’s reply), while the last two Spanish translations (a mother’s address to her daughter and the daughter’s reply) are distillations of the second pair of speeches in Bautista’s Huehuetlahtolli. It appears then that two of Bautista’s pairs of speeches, at least, were based on those originally collected by Olmos.
Purcell notes that “the original friar [i.e., Olmos]. . .made substantive changes by deleting all the names of gods and replacing them with Christian names or titles” (xxxix), but the Christian content and conception of Olmos’ seminal texts may have been much greater. Olmos apparently re-used fragments of them in his tract on the sacrament of Holy Communion (see Téllez Nieto 2022, 29–30). And the c. 1601 Huehuetlahtolli certainly has much in common with the religious writings in Nahuatl that the Franciscans were producing in Mexico in the same period: it has some resemblance to original compositions like the Colloquios de la paz y tranquilidad christiana (1582) and the Espejo divino (1607). In both of those works a missionary friar delivers instructive monologues to which a native convert provides brief responses. Specific wording and concepts in Bautista’s Huehuetlahtolli also recur in Sahagún’s Nahuatl sermons, e.g., tlacatecolotl (‘owlman’ in Purcell’s translation) which serves to designate the devil. A short excerpt (4–5) from the first speech rendered, from a father to his son, illustrates the tenor of the collection:
And wherever you pass in front of the image of our Lord, or of His beloved ones, or of the Cross, you will honor them very much; you will bow down before Him or bend the knee. And it is much better if you go out in front of the very body of our Lord Jesus Christ (who is within the Holy Sacrament).
Yet despite the frequent recurrence of such explicitly Christian admonitions, Purcell identifies the principal work he has translated—Bautista’s Huehuetlahtolli, edited and printed eighty years after the Spanish conquest of Mexico—as one of the “most important texts” from the tradition of “Aztec philosophy”. Given that the translator’s aim is to highlight global traditions of philosophy which might contribute to Western philosophy (ix–x), a more appropriate choice of text might have been the “tlatlatlauhtiliztlatolli”, the ritual speeches assembled in book 6 of the Florentine Codex (edited by Dibble and Anderson 1969). Fray Bernardino Sahagún who copied and translated those discourses into Spanish in 1577 described them as “rhetoric, moral philosophy and theology of the Mexican people’’. As prayers to gods and orations for special occasions (like the election of a new tlatoani or emperor) as well as instructions parents or elders offered to children, these speeches do seem to have originated in a pre-Hispanic Mexican setting and could more plausibly be conceived as “Aztec”. As no such texts in Nahuatl were specifically philosophical, the Aztecs’ philosophical perspectives are best reconstructed from a very wide range of sources which addressed other primary concerns (cf. Maffie 2014). In contrast, Purcell’s packaging of a single work like Bautista’s Huehuetlahtolli as philosophy tout court, imposing extraneous ideas on it, distorting or disregarding its original content, and exoticizing it, is voluntaristic to say the least.
In fact, though, the “Translator’s Introduction” seldom addresses the work it is meant to herald. Purcell ends up invoking a far wider range of sources to set out his own ideas and theories on more general matters. A discussion of “Metaphilosophical Points” suggests (xii–xv) that philosophy is never representative of views and assumptions generally held in a culture or society, so that for ancient Greece and pre-Hispanic Mexico, historical or anthropological concerns have little or no bearing on the questions that would be of interest to a philosopher. This is a view many would contest: scholars of Greco-Roman philosophy and of Aztec thought alike have long attached importance to the proper contextualization of their respective domains.
Further excursuses follow, on “Nahua Metaphysics”, “Ordering and Arranging”, “Nahua Aesthetics” and “Beauty, Fragility and the Good”, which draw from a variety of sources and make some interesting claims (“the Nahuas still think that the configuration of our sun is bound to collapse”, xxxvii). Just one passage from the Huehuetlahtolli is quoted in an adventurous attempt to argue that the arrangement and symmetry of metaphors in a sentence resembles the “cellular organization” of an Aztec altepetl or city (xxv–xxxiv). There are some puzzles and apparent contradictions: Purcell maintains that the Aztecs “have a metaphysical tradition, but no concept of “being”” (ix) and again that “the Nahuas have no ‘ontology’. . . the world is best and most easily conceived as a process of evolving relationships”, but he does not explain why his own translation makes a reference to God as “He Who Lives, He Who Is” (57, my emphasis)—a viable rendering of “in nemohuani, in yelohuani” in Bautista’s original text. Purcell also seems to find it remarkable that the Aztecs “have a sense of mind, but do not conceive of it as distinct from our body” (ix–x), a position long held in the “West”, and familiar enough from Gilbert Ryle’s The Concept of Mind (1949).
The end of the introduction offers some opinions on “A Philosophical Translation” and Purcell lays some stress on the principle of “isomorphic precision” (xliii–xliv). In that regard it would have been helpful if the work being translated had been properly identified at the outset. Nonetheless, this English translation of Bautista’s Huehuetlahtolli is eloquent, and a serviceable complement to Librado Silva Galeana’s Spanish version which accompanied Miguel León-Portilla’s edition of the Nahuatl text (Bautista 1991). As Purcell’s translation retains the paragraph numbering implemented by Silva Galeana and León-Portilla, it may well prove useful to learners and scholars of Nahuatl who prefer to use an English version to find their way around the original, as well as to anyone without Nahuatl or Spanish who would like to get an impression of Fray Juan Bautista’s work. But all readers would be best advised to skip Purcell’s over-long introduction. Though engagingly expressed, his reflections are of little or no value to those who are at all familiar with pre-Cortesian or early colonial Nahua culture, and they are very frequently misleading for those who are not.
REFERENCES
Bautista, Fray Juan 1991. Huehuetlahtolli: Testimonios de la antigua palabra, edited by Miguel León-Portilla, translated by Librado Silva Galeana. Mexico: Fondo de Cultura Económica.
Dibble, Charles E. and Anderson, Arthur J.O. 1969 eds. Florentine Codex Book 6: Rhetoric and Moral Philosophy. Santa Fe: School of American Research. Boulder: University Press of Colorado.
Maffie, James 2014. Aztec Philosophy: Understanding a World in Motion. Boulder: University Press of Colorado.
Ryle, Gilbert 1949. The Concept of Mind. Chicago: Hutchinson’s University Press.
Téllez Nieto, Heréndira 2022. Andrés de Olmos, Arte de le lengua mexicana. Frankfurt: Vervuert Verlagsgesellschaft.