Facing Authority: A Theory of Political Legitimacy

In Facing Authority: A Theory of Political Legitimacy, Thomas Fossen aims to do away with the standard methodologies for thinking through the puzzle of legitimate political authority. After quickly arguing for junking these familiar approaches, Fossen develops his own pragmatist method for analyzing political legitimacy. What the payoff is depends on the point of a theory of legitimate authority. If the point is to understand what is going on when people enter into public conflict with one another over legitimate authority, then the book illuminates. If the point is practical guidance when confronted with questions such as “Is the regime governing me legitimate?” or “Were I in a position to help craft a new constitution, what sort of system should I advocate for?”, then this book disappoints.

Fossen makes two very important moves as groundwork for his theory. The first is to argue against the dominant philosophical approach in the Western tradition. The second is to assume a pragmatist—and more specifically an inferentialist—theory of meaning. All but Chapter One of the book leaps from this pragmatist starting point, unfurling a somewhat baroque and fleetingly profound theory of the practice of judging regimes as legitimate or illegitimate.

The first chapter concerns itself with doing away with “Much philosophical work on legitimacy” in which “the theorist aims to articulate and justify normative standards, presupposing that judgment is a matter of applying such standards to a case at hand” (14). Fossen labels this approach “normativism”. He diagnoses (18-25) normativism as presupposing a theory of judgment that sharply separates determining the moral principles that apply to a case from understanding the case itself. The attractive feature of normativism is that it provides explicit guidance on how to assess the legitimacy of real and imagined regimes. The problem, Fossen argues, is that these approaches treat the very conditions in which the question of legitimacy arises, and in particular, the natures of the regime and the subject making the assessment, as givens in the pejorative sense. Fossen writes that

antecedent moments would, in fact, be at the heart of judgment. One’s grasp of who one is in relation to the authorities, what the regime is like, and one’s sense of history – these are not given prior to judgment but at stake in it. (37)

Thus, simply to assume these as given prior to the act of judging legitimacy—as accessible independent of the very act of judging the legitimacy of the regime—is to theoretically deform the question of political authority.

The first chapter ends with arguments dismissing the views of Rawls and Habermas, both of whom seem not to fit this normativist picture. Both theorists argue that the process of assessing the justice or legitimacy of a regime is, in effect, a practical process through and through. Rawls and Habermas both argue that in many respects the constitution of the political subject is part of the process of seeking justification and not entirely given prior to application of norms. But Fossen objects that these giants of liberal theory make “their accounts of legitimacy bear on the issue [of political legitimacy] in a way that is too dependent on the context of a constitutional democratic regime and therefore fails to get to the bottom of the political problem” (33).

This seems a bit unfair, as Rawls, and perhaps to a lesser degree Habermas, never attempted to give a transhistorically valid account of political legitimacy. They simply assumed a broadly Kantian conception of “a citizen qua self-governing citizen” (33). Apparently, this is unsatisfactory for the “a perplexed subject trying to grasp what is going on” (33), although what Fossen thinks the subject is perplexed about is unclear. Are they deeply religious subjects perplexed about whether, according to the divine right of kings, this prince or that prince has a legitimate claim to kingship, or are they serfs who accept their position, wondering whether they have a claim against their lord, or are they ancient women fully acculturated to a sexist, slave society governed by a god-emperor, wondering whether they are bound to deliver a certain amount of grain to the temple? If so, then Rawls and Habermas are not addressing them, and Fossen’s objection falls flat. (And, as we shall see, Fossen himself offers them nothing to resolve their perplexity.)

Finally, it is mysterious why we should assess Rawls and Habermas from the perspective of people “not so fortunate as to find themselves able to adopt this posture [of seeing themselves as a self-governing citizens]” (33-34). Such a person is either unable to sincerely pose the question of political legitimacy for themselves, or, if they manage to ask whether some regime has authority to govern them, they are well on their way towards adopting the exalted Kantian posture.

Whether normativist political philosophy should be abandoned because it fails to develop a robust theory of political judgment rests to some degree on whether an attractive alternative theory has a significant philosophical payoff. The rest of the book—Chapters Two through Six—develops such a theory. It is built around Robert Brandom’s semantic inferentialism. Fossen states that he “will just assume this pragmatist view of meaning rather than defend it” (42). (Everyone must start somewhere, but it is odd, on the one hand, to dismiss Rawls and Habermas for assuming the self-governing subject while, on the other hand, to assume, less than ten pages later, a particularly contested view of meaning as required for any agent to understand what they are doing when contesting authority.) It’s well beyond the scope of this review to rehearse Brandom’s inferentialism, much less the deep well of pragmatist philosophy animating Brandom’s views and playing both subterranean and explicit roles in Fossen’s arguments. But the central idea is that meaning is constituted within a discursive scorekeeping practice. Brandom puts it this way:

Saying or thinking that things are thus-and-so is undertaking a distinctive kind of inferentially articulated commitment: putting it forward as a fit premise for further inferences, that is, authorizing its use as such a premise, and undertaking responsibility to entitle oneself to that commitment, to vindicate one’s authority, under suitable circumstances, paradigmatically by exhibiting it as the conclusion of an inference from other such commitments to which one is or can become entitled (2000,11).

Since, for Fossen, to be a regime is to claim to rule, then, within the inferentialist framework Fossen develops, judging a regime to be legitimate just is to make this sort of commitment, which in Fossen’s terms is to “take a stance” (48) towards that regime—either as the regime or as the subject—in relation to this claim and within some specific discursive practice. In particular, to judge a regime as il/legitimate is just to respond to its “attempts to rule” through “complying, actively supporting, resisting, or trying to evade them as much as possible” (49). As a result, judgments of political authority are not doxastic: “…they are commitments to do certain things” (56—italics in original). It is not to attribute some property to the regime, as one might do when one says that the constitution establishes an office of the president (42, the example is mine). The chapter concludes (56-66) with a lengthy analysis of this stancetaking that is quite reminiscent of Allan Gibbard’s (1990) norm expressivism (which is not surprising given the inferentialist framework). It is too detailed to discuss here, but its ingenuity and specifics would be well worth interrogating by philosophers interested in political theory, inferentialism, and meta-ethics.

Chapter Three explores how the stance taking of political judgment is a relentless “temporarily extended [intersubjective] practice” because

one cannot avoid adopting some stance toward the regime, however implicitly, since one inevitably treats the authorities in one way or another, whether one ignores them as much as possible, actively provides support, engages in resistance, or attempts to flee (79).

This linking of judgment to action entails that “judgments of legitimacy are essentially public, manifested in action”, and so a “subjective decision that is not (yet) manifested in action, that has not entered the space of appearance and shows its political face, has not truly happened” (80). In interesting passages, Fossen develops this idea by appeal to Hannah Arendt’s work by arguing that responses to one’s behavior partially determine what one has done. Thus, judgments about legitimate authority end up being socially constituted and not entirely under the control of the agent making that judgment: “What someone has done, indeed whether they have acted at all, depends on how this is understood, sustained, and potentially transformed by others.” Fossen goes on to say:

…the meaning or propositional content of an action cannot be understood in terms of correspondence with a subject’s intention, but is bound up with an ongoing intersubjective practice of interpretation. As a consequence, with regard to her actions [and so her judgments of legitimacy which are realized in her actions], an agent cannot be sovereign (81).

This account, which Fossen’s footnote doesn’t quite do justice in indicating how much it echoes Sharon Krause (2015), suggests the surprising possibility that many philosophical treatises purporting to offer theories of legitimacy aren’t about legitimacy. Such views, however carefully adumbrated and defended across hundreds of pages of text, are in fact not political judgments at all, at least in Fossen’s sense of taking a stance towards some determinate regime seeking to rule the author. The proof is in the author’s actions: If the author simply goes along with the regime to get along, then their written expression that the current regime is illegitimate is semantically swamped by their behavior of treating the regime as legitimate. What exactly the seminar room text means, then, is mysterious. The same can be said about texts written long in the past, when the actions of the author in relation to the regime may be forgotten or impossible to discern. What is the semantic status of those texts on political legitimacy, given that we have no idea what role they played within the author’s life of relating to the regime under which they lived? Fossen does not explore this puzzle.

The final three chapters (aside from the conclusion) apply this more abstract theory to argue that legitimacy claims construct the regime, the self, and time. For reasons of space, I shall discuss only Chapters Four and Five, although Chapter Six, which is about time-making, is well worth consideration and the general form of its arguments follows the structure of the arguments in Chapters Four and Five.

Chapter Four contains a fascinating discussion of the way that the practice of judgment is partially constitutive of the regime. In particular, judging legitimacy involves “portraying power”, which is to say that it constructs a picture of the claim-maker and the regime (or, in the case of the regime insisting on its legitimacy, of the regime and those it aims to rule). How this picture is taken up discursively partially determines the nature of the subject and regime. This is not a one-off process and instead involves “reiterated portrayals” (107), to which one’s audience can respond in a myriad of ways. Fossen develops an elaborate structure of these judgments, comprising a subject (the action of representing, e.g., a speech, a picture, a performance), the maker(s) and audience of the subject, the referent of the representation (e.g., a regime), and the characterization of the referent as having some property (e.g., as undemocratic) (104-105). When one judges the legitimacy of a regime, then, one is in effect attempting to construct a picture of the regime by portraying its claim to power according to this schema. All this applies to legitimacy claims made by protesters (who are the paradigmatic characters throughout Fossen’s text), as well as by defenders of the regime, including its officials.

Fossen introduces at pp. 113-121 standards of judgment, which he labels ‘responsiveness’, ‘truthfulness’, and ‘virtuosity’. These standards are the basis on which one ought to assess judgments of legitimacy. The discussions in these sections confuse because they seem to waver between an abandonment of inferentialism’s full-throated pragmatism and the spectre of Fossen’s otherwise thoroughgoing commitment to pragmatism. For example, under the heading of truthfulness “doing justice to the way things are involves a willingness to consider evidence and to follow it where it leads” (118). One must “[get] a grip on what the regime is like…” (117), which is “a matter of what the regime does” (118). This suggests a non-inferentialist epistemic standard governing judgment (after all, Fossen’s inferentialism concerns meaning, not the rationality of belief).

On this reading of the truthfulness standard, a group of people can’t constitute the character of a regime by portraying it in one way when all the evidence suggests otherwise. In particular, one who enters this discursive fray about whether the regime is legitimate is on the hook for “integrating one’s own perceptions and the testimonies of others into one’s broader range of commitments about the regime and the world more widely, assessing whether those claims make sense and what follows from them” (119). A natural reading of this suggests fairly standard epistemic norms apply to legitimacy judgments. But Fossen seems to be serious about the global applicability of inferentialism (the sentence following the bit just quoted states that the “face of power is inferentially articulated”). So, perhaps the truthfulness of judgments of legitimacy are so sensitive to discursive context that so long as one surrounds oneself with carefully curated sorts of persons, one cannot fall afoul of this norm. Given a certain discursive ecosystem, how could a 17th Century English Royalist who endorses the divine right of kings err, at least with respect to truthfulness, in judging that Charles I was the legitimate absolute ruler of England? At the very least, any norm that permits this should not be labeled a ‘truthfulness’ norm.

Chapter Five develops the claim that the self is constituted through judgments of political legitimacy. Fossen begins by interrogating three separate conceptions of the self as it relates to such judgments: a ‘foundationalist’ picture, according to which “what the governed are fundamentally like” (128) is given prior to judgment; an associative (e.g., a communitarian) picture, according to which one’s identity is constituted by the collective identity active within one’s social and political community; and the agonistic picture, according to which one’s identity is constituted “through being structurally taken and treated in certain ways” (136). Fossen argues that each approach has its merits, but each also falls short in critical ways. Unsurprisingly, the first two presuppose an uncontested given (the self as autonomous agent and the character of the community in which one finds oneself, respectively), and the third, since it emphasizes the radical contingency of the self, “tells us little about how to practically go on in the face of concrete dilemmas” (138).^[1]

Fossen does not so much dismiss these views as develop an account that takes lessons from each. Legitimacy judgments, according to Fossen, perform a surprising amount of practical labor self- and community-constitution: “judging the legitimacy of a regime is to partake of a practice of self-constitution and self-transformation” by venturing to “constitute, sustain, or dissolve a collective of such-and-such character, and to characterize individuals as members (or nonmembers) of that collective” (143).

At this point, it appears that Fossen has become overly captivated by an example that runs constantly throughout the text, namely, the 2011 Tahrir Square protests in Egypt. These were no doubt transformative events for all involved. But not every instance of political judgment rises to the level of participating in spectacular mass action seeking to topple a repressive government. The self-altering powers of events like the Tahrir Square protests seem to far outstrip the effects of far more common casual assessments of the legitimacy of regimes. By relying so heavily on the Tahrir Square protests as one of his only two paradigmatic examples of legitimacy judgments, he may be putting unjustified rhetorical weight behind the claim that legitimacy judgments partially constitute self and community.

By the end of the book, it is clear that if Fossen is correct, then beyond articulating the complex structure of what is going one when one makes claims about the il/legitimacy of a regime and how such claims reflexively shape the subject and can prospectively contribute to the character of a regime, all philosophers can offer are weak internal norms governing the practice of making such claims. In other words, political theorists are confused about their very own area of inquiry when they offer substantive principles of legitimate authority. The only live philosophical project is analyzing the structure of the practice of making legitimacy claims. Any attempt at spelling out even narrowly bounded principles of legitimate authority either faultily embraces the myth of the given or is just one move within a broader popular discursive practice. Such principles cannot themselves be correct or incorrect. One can only articulate them responsively, truthfully, and with virtuosity. Fossen offers no principled basis for concluding that two contradictory principles can’t both be equally responsive, truthful, and formulated with virtuosity, and therefore no basis for rejecting either or embracing both.

In his conclusion, Fossen acknowledges that the book presents a deflationary view of political legitimacy (191). On his view, all discussions of political legitimacy occur in medias res, which is to say that they are put forward within an actual, determinate political context with particular histories and networks of normative relations. These discussions therefore can only be understood in relation to that context. Fossen provides tools for excavating those conditions, and in turn generates a semantics for these legitimacy claims. The book is therefore most successful as a provocation to think more carefully about how political contestation functions. But, it is quite politically conservative—or at best quietist—in that it reframes creative thinking about how the world ought to be as nothing more than a move in a game of political discourse. On the one hand, this is obviously true, and Fossen impresses with his complex rendering of the rules of this game. On the other hand, in insisting that the search for principles of legitimate authority misunderstands itself to the point of incoherence and that all we can hope to do is to understand what we are doing when we advocate for one principle or another, we are left with the anti-utopian charge that we are simply confused when we ask whether we’ve gotten it right.

REFERENCES

Robert B. Brandom, Articulating Reasons: An Introduction to Inferentialism (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 2000).

Allan Gibbard, Wise Choices, Apt Feelings: A Theory of Normative Judgment (Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press, 1990).

Sharon R. Krause, Freedom Beyond Sovereignty: Reconstructing Liberal Individualism (Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 2015).