From a Marxist-Feminist Point of View is a must-read not only for social and political thinkers but for any student of the social world interested in freedom and justice. In this far-ranging twelve-essay volume, Nancy Holmstrom brings together decades of work on the key questions of the Marxist-feminist tradition.
The theoretical core of the book, and the theme of the first part, is the concept of a ‘mode of production’. In the first chapter, Holmstrom characterizes a mode of production as having “certain kinds of structures and tendencies, a certain nature” (13). This nature sets limits on what kinds of changes are possible within that society. For example, capitalism’s “built-in imperative” for profit maximization constrains the realization of both gender and race equality and of ecological sustainability. Holmstrom makes an important interpretive clarification by stressing that in Marx’s theory exploitation is not unique to capitalism. Instead, it is “essential to all class societies”, meaning all societies in which producers lack means of subsistence and are forced to work for owners who reap the fruits of their labor (13).
The second chapter offers a clear statement of the book’s point of view. Holmstrom defines socialist feminism as a mutual anti-reductionism—taking class seriously in women’s lives without subsuming gender oppression under economic exploitation (17). While sympathetic to the concerns of ‘dual systems theorists’ who urge us to take seriously the benefits men extract from the exploitation of women, she argues against treating patriarchy as a ‘system’ separate from capitalism. Holmstrom’s main concern is to retain “explanatory coherence”, meaning to provide an explanation of how and why different modes of oppression work together, rather than give a ‘simple pluralist’ description of their co-existence (23-24). Ultimately, she endorses the strategy of conceptualizing capitalism as the “framework within which other relations of oppression operate”, which gives capitalism explanatory primacy without eliminating the causal efficacy of gender and race relations (24).
Holmstrom starts the third chapter of the book, “Sex, Work and Capitalism” by expressing her frustration at the state of contemporary debates. Framing sex work as a matter of either ‘empowerment’ or ‘oppression’ is both misleading and reductive, artificially boiling a complex phenomenon down to a conflict between two ‘sides’ (26). Pace pro-prostitution feminists, she invokes the distinction between subjective psychological ‘empowerment’ and actual power, noting that “something could be ‘empowering’ for certain women, but dis-empowering for women in general” (29). And pace anti-work radicals who argue that the problem with sex work is ‘not the sex, but the work’, she carefully draws the distinction between Marx’s critique of wage labor and his theory of work as the realization of our species-character (31-34). Finally, pace ahistorical moralistic condemnations of prostitution, Holmstrom stays true to her historical materialism by arguing that sex work in a capitalist and patriarchal society is the ‘ultimate kind of alienation’ (37). A different society might make the nature and effects of the activity, both individually and collectively, different (37-38).
The fourth chapter defends the thesis that while women’s domestic work is not productive in the sense of producing surplus value, it benefits capitalism by “reducing the value of labor power” (42). Holmstrom shows that the exclusion of domestic work from the category of productivity (along with other types of work like supervisory labor or public employment) is not a contingent result of Marx’s own biased or sexist perspective. Rather, it is a result of analyzing capitalism from the perspective of capital itself—as essentially “a system devoted to the production of surplus value” (47). Domestic labor nevertheless benefits capitalism by reducing the cost of reproducing labor power (49). The fact that women are the ones performing this labor also benefits capitalism by sustaining their super-exploitation as wage workers, with their role in the family used to justify discrimination, underemployment, and occupational segregation (52). Finally, Holmstrom shows that housewives are exploited in the Marxist sense because force and surplus labor are both present in domestic work (54).
The first part of the book concludes by articulating and defending the goal of democratic socialism, understood as a classless society in which associated producers own and control the means of production collectively (69). Democracy is not only the end but the means to realizing this goal. Democratic organizing and struggle pave the way for a ‘socialism from below’ by developing people’s vision, experience, and capacity for self-rule (71). Democratic socialism, in Holmstrom’s view, is inherently ecosocialist and feminist, as its social rationality and orientation towards well-being shift our understanding and pursuit of productivity (72-75).
Holmstrom starts the second part of the book, on rationality, with a discussion of revolution. Chapter Six shows how the rationality of revolutionary action undermines key assumptions of utility maximizing theories of human motivation, including its ahistorical, individualist, and consequentialist character (90-93). More fundamentally, utility maximization has a very limited conception of rationality because it only focuses on means (94). From a Marxist perspective, by contrast, rationality itself is an end—“that of bringing the world under conscious human control” (96). Chapter Seven advances the critique by connecting our impoverished conception of rationality to our limited understanding of property as private property. We need a new collective common sense coupled with an expanded understanding of the ‘commons’ if we are to address the greatest security threat we are collectively facing—the environmental crisis (98-99).
Part Three gives a far-reaching critique of the theoretical ideal of freedom and its practice under capitalism. Chapter Eight creatively critiques compatibilist conceptions of freedom through the lens of false consciousness and false needs under capitalism. Actions can be unfree even when they are caused by an agent’s own wants (127-128). This is the case with unnatural wants that are induced coercively or without the agent’s knowledge and that would not have arisen otherwise (130). Despite our ability to satisfy our wants, capitalism is therefore rife with unfreedom, Holmstrom shows, because of our lack of collective control of the material conditions that determine those same wants (131).
In Chapter Nine, Holmstrom engages in an ambitious critique of theoretical and practical dimensions of capitalism, in particular its conception of freedom and its claim to be the freest of all economic systems (149). Her lens for critique is whether capitalism is good for women. Detaching freedom from normatively loaded notions of self-ownership (168), she proposes a nuanced framework that considers not only the presence and absence of obstacles but the nature and quality of the choices involved. While some of the structural obstacles that women face under capitalism could in theory be removed, the hierarchy between capital owners and workers remains an inherent obstacle to freedom (189). Capitalism in practice, Holmstrom contends, has the tendency and potential to create better conditions of women than pre-capitalist societies (195). But it at the same time places “systemic barriers” to women’s (and human) liberation—from global uneven development to the gendered and racialized division of labor. Progress towards liberation stops whenever it conflicts with the interests of dominant classes (222).
In the last part of the book, Holmstrom applies a historical materialist methodology to the much-disputed question of women’s and human nature. Chapter Ten puts forward an account of the “dialectical interaction between women’s labor and their nature” to argue that insofar as we can talk about a ‘women’s nature’ consisting of distinct cognitive/affective structures, it is the social product of a historical sexual division of labor (239). This view of gender is contrasted with conceptions of human nature and race in Chapter Eleven. Against critics who fear the concept is inherently deterministic and conservative, Holmstrom shows both the coherence and normative importance of a theory of human nature. We have certain biologically invariant needs and capacities. But these crucially include the capacity to labor, which allows us to make and remake our forms of life and shape ourselves as social beings in the process (254). It is precisely this distinctive capacity that is alienated under capitalism, as the twelfth and final chapter shows. Workers are not only alienated from the products and activity of labor, as well as each other, but from their species character as beings who produce freely and consciously (282). Human nature therefore plays an essential role in the diagnosis and critique of alienation (289).
It is worth considering how Holmstrom’s discussion of capitalism as a mode of production advances our understanding of the relation between capitalism, on one hand, and race and gender oppression on the other. She suggests that a mode of production is neither reducible to “the economy” nor “equivalent to the vaguer notion of ‘social formation’” (3). In her discussion of the relation of domestic labor to capitalism, she further defines a mode of production, following Laclau, as a ‘complex of social productive forces and relations linked to a determinate type of ownership of the means of production’ (60). These remarks raise many crucial questions. What is the difference between the ‘social system’ or ‘social formation’ and the ‘mode of production’? Should we understand capitalism, as Nancy Fraser suggests, as an institutionalized social order that cannibalizes extra-economic realms such as nonhuman nature or care work (Fraser, 2022)? Are all social relations part of the relevant capitalist complex?
How we answer these questions seems to bear on the relation between capitalism and gender or racial oppression. The more elements of the ‘social formation’ are defined as part of capitalism as a mode of production, the less compelling the case for dual or triple systems theory. But is something lost by integrating all social spheres under the umbrella of capitalism? Answering these questions would likewise help fill in the details of the author’s promising suggestion of a ‘framework’ model that makes capitalism foundational but not solely causally efficacious (24). The chapter on women’s work and the family makes the most explicit inroads in this direction by explaining how women’s domestic labor in the family benefits capitalism (42-64). Holmstrom argues that the family or household should not be understood as a separate mode of production but rather “totally integrated into the capitalist mode of production” (60). Is this the case for all social subsystems? If so, what does their causal efficacy amount to?
Another question always in the background of Marxist theorizing is the normative basis for critique. In her discussion of false wants and alienation, Holmstrom takes a more proceduralist path. Here, she is hopeful about the possibility to largely eliminate false wants in a classless society with real collective democratic control (135). Likewise, she emphasizes that we can overcome alienation in a society where “the conditions shaping human nature are under the control of the majority” and “human nature takes its shape without coercion, without distortion” (285). But perhaps we might need a more robust, substantive standard of human flourishing as our normative yardstick. One can imagine a socialist democracy in which human beings nevertheless did not realize all their distinctive powers, e.g., a society without a proper appreciation of the arts, or one in which individual development was one-sided, still ‘chained to only one single fragment of the whole’ (Schiller [1794], 2004). In other words, is it possible to achieve conscious control and mastery of the means of production but still fall short of a full realization of human nature?
It is a testament to Holmstrom’s careful reflection and generous treatment of opposing views that this book has as much to offer to committed Marxists, to feminists, as well as to critics of either tradition. Much skepticism has been expressed about the marriage between Marxism and feminism. Holmstrom’s work makes the case that the relationship is happier than ever. And against skepticism born of an ideological tyranny of no alternatives, her book gives us reason to hope that ‘a better world is possible’, even to those who may disagree with her substantive vision.
REFERENCES
Fraser, Nancy. Cannibal capitalism: How our system is devouring democracy, care, and the planet and what we can do about it. Verso books, 2023.
Schiller, Friedrich. On the Aesthetic Education of Man, 1794. Transl. Reginald Snell, Dover Publications, 2004.