From Eternal to Everlasting: God and Time in Franciscan Thought

In contemporary Anglophone discussions of God’s relation to time, the word ‘eternal’ is typically used to describe a divine life in which there is no before and after, no succession, no “flowing now”—nothing, in other words, that could count as temporal. The word ‘everlasting’, by contrast, is used to describe a divine life that does involve temporal succession: a succession that has neither beginning nor end and is accordingly infinite, but succession nonetheless. So, readers coming to Lydia Schumacher’s From Eternal to Everlasting: God and Time in Franciscan Thought may be expecting an argument to the effect that Franciscan thinkers moved away from what had been the standard medieval view that God is timelessly eternal to the view that God is everlasting, having infinite temporal duration.

That is not the argument we find in Schumacher’s book. Instead, we find a more modest claim, namely, that Franciscan thinkers came to emphasize divine infinity rather than divine simplicity, and that this change of emphasis had important philosophical consequences. The doctrine of divine eternity, she says,

lay [sic] the emphasis on God’s otherness while the doctrine of everlastingness stresses the relation of all times to him. . . these differences in emphasis in terms of God’s relation to time follow from a deeper difference in understanding the nature of God and his relationship to creatures: either as simple and thus incommensurable with finite beings or as infinite and thus directly related to finite beings as their cause, while nonetheless superseding them. (101)

Schumacher rightly does not go so far as to say that any Franciscan adopted a theory of divine everlastingness in our contemporary sense of that expression; rather, she argues that

the later Franciscan views particularly bear some resemblance to modern accounts of God’s everlastingness, [although] many of these go much further in attributing temporal categories to God. (101)

In Chapter 1, “The Divine Nature: Simple or Infinite?” Schumacher traces medieval accounts of divine simplicity through the usual suspects (Augustine, Boethius, and Anselm), as well as a number of figures who are often overlooked in these discussions: Peter Lombard, Richard of St Victor, Alan of Lille, and the early Franciscan Alexander of Hales. It is with Alexander that we first see the shift in focus from simplicity to infinity that Schumacher wishes to chronicle. In Alexander’s Glossa, eternity is linked closely with simplicity, as is fairly standard up to that point. But in the later Summa Halensis, written under Alexander’s supervision but not entirely his own work (the section at issue here was probably composed by John of La Rochelle), God’s relation to time is considered, not in the short section on divine simplicity, but in the far longer discussion of God’s infinity or immensity, to which Schumacher turns in Chapter 2, “The Divine Nature: Eternal or Everlasting?” The Summa Halensis defines eternity, properly understood, as “duration without beginning and without end and without mutability” (35); so understood, eternity characterizes God alone. Other things can be sempiternal, having a beginning but no end, though such things can be called ‘eternal’ by analogy: an eternal angel, eternal punishment of the wicked, even time itself.

I have some difficulty in making out what is supposed to be new in the Summa Halensis’s discussion of God’s relation to time. Schumacher rightly says that “the Summa pays tribute to the traditional view. . .that eternity is like a single instant, in which past and future are immediately present to God” (38). What’s puzzling is how she continues: “At the same time, however, the author advances the novel claim that time is somehow present to God, in virtue of his ‘infinite power to contain all durable things’ as their cause” (38). Since the previous sentence says that the traditional view held that past and future are immediately present to God, how is it now a novel claim that time is present to God? Perhaps we should delete the stray comma after “present to God” in the second sentence and identify the novelty as the claim that the basis of time’s presence to God is God’s infinite power to cause all things that are capable of duration. But that’s not particularly new: We can find versions of that claim in many of the earlier authors Schumacher studies in the first part of the chapter. And in any event, the Summa Halensis doesn’t claim that time’s presence to God is a matter of God’s infinite power to cause things capable of duration. Rather, it says that we can speak of eternities—in the plural—because eternity, which in itself is one and indivisible, has an infinite power to contain all things capable of duration. That is, eternity is boundlessly capacious.^[1] 

Chapter 3, “Metaphysical Foundations in Avicenna and the Summa Halensis”, focuses on elements of Avicenna’s metaphysics that “were adopted by the Summa Halensis, and which ultimately if in some cases only indirectly contributed to the development of its views on time and eternity” (40). These include Avicenna’s modal metaphysics, his proof of a Necessary Existent (God), and “the theory of infinite possible worlds, which served as a basis for the Summa’s views on divine infinity” (40). As Schumacher notes, Avicenna himself had no explicit theory of possible worlds, just some of the modal ingredients needed for such a theory. It was the author of the Summa Halensis who made the theory explicit: “In God there is the possibility of [making] infinite worlds (infinitos mundos); therefore, it is possible for infinite worlds to be created” (47). The divine power is indeterminate with respect to creating any one of those worlds; it is made determinate by a “preordained disposition”—presumably a disposition on the part of the divine will.

Chapter 4, “Time in Avicenna and the Franciscan Tradition”, delves further into the ways in which Avicenna’s metaphysics of time influenced early Franciscan views. Schumacher begins with Aristotle, who, she says (following Jon McGinnis), thought of time “in ‘static’ terms as the interval between two temporal moments” (56)—hence Aristotle’s famous characterization of time as “a number of change in respect of the before and after” (55). Avicenna, by contrast, thinks of time dynamically, “as the continuous movement or flow of the present moment from the future into the past” (56). Such flow essentially involves change: What before was merely possible is now actual. As the Necessary Existent, God is subject to no such modal change; he is entirely outside time. The Summa Halensis develops Avicenna’s account of time “as a kind of motion or constant change which involves the continuous flow of the ‘now’” (60). Later Franciscan thinkers will argue about the nature of the ‘now’—and even about whether it makes sense to speak of a ‘now’ in the ever-rolling stream of time—but will agree with “the fundamentally Avicennian insight that time is a kind of motion” (82).

Having carefully surveyed these debates in Franciscan thought after the Summa Halensis, Schumacher raises a striking question: “The question that remains to address in light of this is whether the Franciscan account of time was deliberately paired with, or even followed from, the moderate understanding of God as ‘everlasting’ which they also advocated” (82). The hypothesis of the whole book, she explains, is that the two are closely connected. A more static conception of time pairs well with an emphasis on the all-encompassing ‘now’ of divine eternity as contrasted with the ever-shifting ‘now’ of human temporal experience, whereas a more dynamic conception of time shifts the focus from the temporal ‘now’ to the “continuum of time as a whole” (82). She continues:

This more dynamic way of construing time relates more naturally to a view of God who is somehow able to track with the motion of time, even though he himself is outside of time and thus does not move. In that sense, we can see why the early Franciscans preferred to describe God as a being of ‘infinite duration’, namely, because he is the ultimate arbiter of the duration of motion which it is the purpose of time to measure. (83)

One odd thing about this claim is that we’re never given any evidence that any Franciscan thinker described God as a being of infinite duration. Schumacher quotes no such text.^[2] Searches for various forms of diuturnitas infinita and duratio infinita in the Library of Latin Texts (a comprehensive though not exhaustive database) turned up no description of God as a being of infinite duration, though there are a handful of texts that characterize Boethian eternity as infinite duration and somewhat more texts describing the omnitemporal universe God could have created (but didn’t) as having infinite duration.

As for “the moderate understanding of God as ‘everlasting’” (82) that the Franciscans are supposed to have advocated, evidence that there was any such understanding is, if anything, even more equivocal. The Latin word corresponding to ‘everlasting’ in the sense I defined in my first paragraph is sempiternus—or so I should have thought. But it turns out that authors who held fast to the traditional view of divine timelessness were perfectly happy to call God sempiternus, doubtless because the Vulgate did. Descriptions of God as sempiternus are in fact far more frequent in Thomas Aquinas—a stalwart defender of divine timelessness—than in any other thirteenth-century author. So there is no terminological shift to signal any conceptual change.

What, then, is that conceptual change? There are indications throughout the book that Schumacher regards the most salient distinguishing feature of the Franciscan view of God as everlasting to be its affirmation that “temporal moments are present to God precisely in terms of their temporality—as past, present, or future—rather than simply viewed simultaneously from the perspective of his ‘eternal now’” (4). The argument for this claim is made in the final chapter, “God’s Knowledge of Future Contingents”, in which Schumacher focuses on the discussion of divine foreknowledge in the Summa Halensis, John Duns Scotus, and William of Ockham.

Here is how the Summa Halensis treats the question of whether God knows the past as past:

This phrase ‘God does not know the past as past’ has a dual meaning: this determination ‘as past’ can specify the verb in comparison to the knower, and in this sense, it is true, because the past does not exist in God in the mode of the past, but in his own mode; or it can specify the verb in comparison to the known, and in this sense, it is false: God indeed knows past things and things that are under the condition of pastness and futureness, but he does not know them under these conditions, but eternally and presently. (87)

In other words, God knows past things and future things, but he does not know them as past or future; he knows them eternally, as present. This is exactly what any defender of the standard view of divine timelessness would say.

But not every such defender would go on to say, as the Summa Halensis does, that God knows what is temporally past, present, and future because he causes all of it. Boethius in the Consolation of Philosophy (Book V, prose 6) pictures God as a spectator, his eyes on the whole of time from his eternal vantage point; just as I know what my dog is doing because I see her doing it (and not the other way around), God knows temporal events because they take place (and not the other way around). The Summa Halensis, by contrast, argues that God brings about—in his eternal present—the temporal items that he thereby knows—also in his eternal present.^[3]

John Duns Scotus goes further by rejecting the idea that divine eternity provides any explanation of how God knows future contingents. God coexists with all times that exist, but only the present exists. But on Schumacher’s account, Scotus basically agrees with the Summa Halensis’s positive account of God’s knowledge of future contingents. He simply gives it a characteristically Scotist spin by appealing to the division of labor between the divine intellect and the divine will. First (logically first, not temporally first—Scotus is quite clear that there is no succession in God), the divine intellect cognizes all contingent propositions (including propositions about what happens in time) as neutral, that is, as neither true nor false. Then the divine will brings it about that some are true, and the divine intellect accordingly knows those propositions to be true. In other words, God knows what occurs in time because he causes what occurs in time.

But what about sins? God knows them, but he doesn’t bring them about; a created will does. Scotus recognized the problem but had no solution; Ockham would see it as insuperable and as devastating. Here I can’t improve on Schumacher’s summary of Ockham’s conclusions:

As Ockham writes: ‘since the determination of the created will does not exist from eternity, God did not have certain cognition of the things that remained for a created will to determine.’ Despite affirming this, Ockham concedes that God must know the future, by virtue of his intuitive cognition, which makes all things past and future present to him. Nevertheless, he acknowledges that we cannot know how God thus knows the future—we can only assume by faith that he does so. As Ockham concludes: ‘it is impossible to express clearly the way in which God knows future contingents.’ (95–96)

Ockham’s view would, as Schumacher says (quoting Calvin Normore) quickly become the opinio communis of the early fourteenth century. Surely (this is me now, not Schumacher) this position—we could call it Idiopathic Foreknowledge—is philosophically unsatisfactory. It may, however, be the best that the defender of complete and infallible divine foreknowledge can hope for. (I will not be taking calls from Molinists at this time.)

From Eternal to Everlasting is undoubtedly a worthy contribution both to the history of philosophy and to the ongoing discussion of God’s relationship to time. Schumacher’s hope in recovering the 13^th- and 14^th-century Franciscan discussion is to offer a “more moderate conception” of divine eternity that can speak to at least some of the philosophical worries that many contemporary philosophers of religion have about a wholly timeless God in whose life there is no succession. I have raised some concerns, both historical and philosophical, about whether in the end there is such a conception to be found. But the attempt is not merely worth making. It is worth taking seriously.

REFERENCES

Anselm, Proslogion, in F. S. Schmitt, ed., S. Anselmi Cantuariensis Archiepiscopi Opera Omnia (Stuttgart-Bad Canstatt: Friedrich Fromann Verlag, 1968).

Anselm, De concordia, in F. S. Schmitt, ed., S. Anselmi Cantuariensis Archiepiscopi Opera Omnia (Stuttgart-Bad Canstatt: Friedrich Fromann Verlag, 1968).

Gloria Frost and Simo Knuuttila, "Medieval Theories of Future Contingents," The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2025 Edition), Edward N. Zalta & Uri Nodelman (eds.).

Thomas Williams, ed. and trans., Anselm: The Complete Treatises with Selected Letters and Prayers and the Meditation on Human Redemption (Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 2022).

Thomas Williams, “Can Anselm Have Everything He Wants?” The Saint Anselm Journal 17 (2021): 1–18.