The traditional story of the development of modern philosophy is a good, if inaccurate, story not least because it finds a compelling antagonist in the figure of Hume. According to that story, the importance of Hume’s philosophy lies in his development of a boundless skepticism in the guise of a science of human nature. In addition to clashing with our ordinary understanding of our epistemic position, this skepticism undermines his own more targeted contributions to normative epistemology, such as his arguments against the rationality of religious belief. It is only by later philosophers such as Kant and Reid, so the story goes, that philosophy is saved from the skeptical abyss that Hume pried open.
The traditional narrative of modern philosophy is less prevalent than it once was. But it remains the case that Hume’s skeptical arguments are widely regarded as the center of his achievements in what we now call epistemology. So understood, what Hume has to contribute to our questions about knowledge, belief, and rationality is primarily negative: an assortment of problems in need of an answer. This valuable collection presents a more holistic picture of Hume’s epistemology, one that pays due attention to his skepticism without neglecting other, more constructive elements. In addition to providing many interpretive insights, the essays combine to make a powerful case that epistemologists can still benefit from thinking with Hume. The collection includes sixteen essays, which the editors organize into nine parts. I highlight some contributions that struck me as representative of its contents.
Among the most recognizable aspects of Hume's philosophy is his methodology of clarifying ideas by considering the impressions from which they are derived. In “A Humean Practicalist Conception of Knowing”, Stephen Hetherington applies this method to the idea of knowledge. In Hetherington’s view, the idea would be derived from impressions of manifestations of knowledge-episodes, such as (accurate) assertion, explanation, and reasoning. Hetherington takes this conclusion to suggest a practicalism according to which all knowledge-that is knowledge-how. Further, he recommends a metaphysically thin conception of knowledge, according to which it is, like the Humean self, a “metaphysically accidental grouping of characteristics and circumstances” (17). Hetherington suggests that this bundle theory of knowledge is in tension with Hume’s own infallibilism: in view of knowledge's mutability, objective certainty could fail to be included in knowledge's nature. This sort of argument would, if successful, seem to undermine any account of knowledge’s nature, perhaps including Hetherington’s own practicalism.
In the concluding section of the first Enquiry, Hume positions himself in opposition to Pyrrhonian skepticism, which he takes to advocate a total suspension of judgment. In “Hume on Pyrrhonian Scepticism and Suspension of Judgement”, Verena Wagner and Scott Stapleford consider Hume's understanding of the suspension of judgment and its role in inquiry. They argue that we find in Hume a distinction between “sceptical suspension” and “natural suspension”, where the latter but not the former withstands return to common life. Further, they argue that Hume endorses the Pyrrhonian thought that suspension of judgment in response to an equipollent dispute produces, in some circumstances, a settled doxastic state. For Hume, suspension has this effect only when the relevant case of equipollence does not involve a psychologically irresistible belief.
This account of Humean suspension is developed in reference to the sort of suspension (epoché) advocated by Sextus Empiricus. According to Wagner and Stapleford, Sextus holds that “suspension of judgement consists in abandoning the aim of answering the question in response to the recognition of an equipollent dispute” (55). But this characterization appears to undermine Sextus’s distinction between the Pyrrhonian skeptic and the Academic skeptic. The former responds to a failure to apprehend the truth by continuing to investigate. The latter responds by deciding that the truth is inapprehensible and ceasing to investigate. Were Pyrrhonian suspension equivalent to suspension of inquiry, Pyrrhonism would collapse into negative dogmatism.
In his “The Priority of Passive Reasoning”, Jonathan Cottrell develops a Humean rejoinder to Paul Boghossian’s (2018) argument that the philosophically most important kind of reasoning is active reasoning. According to Boghossian, the kind of reasoning that is of interest to the epistemologist is a mental action over which a thinker has control and for which she can be held responsible. By contrast, Hume focuses on reasoning as a passive mental process. Cottrell argues that Hume’s emphasis is explained and justified by his view that passive reasoning is epistemically prior to active reasoning. Cottrell shows that this claim of epistemic priority is a consequence of considerations included in Hume's skeptical argument concerning induction. On Cottrell’s reading, then, it is an aspect of Hume’s skepticism that explains his emphasis on passive reasoning.
But another explanation (compatible with Cottrell’s) appeals to his naturalism, one strand of which holds that human minds are continuous in their nature and operations with the minds of non-human animals. Hume argues that his theory of reasoning––according to which our inductive expectations are, in the first place, products of unreflective habit––gains support from the fact that it makes human reasoning of a piece with the reasoning of non-human animals. An alternative explanation of Hume’s emphasis on passive reasoning is that it serves to identify human reasoning as a species of animal reasoning.
In addition to his skepticism and naturalism, one of the central themes of Hume’s philosophy is his opposition to rationalism. In his “In Search of Hume's Anti-Rationalism”, Karl Schafer carefully distinguishes several forms of anti-rationalism found in Hume. One familiar variant consists in his denial, in opposition to figures like Leibniz and Spinoza, that reason enables us to discover truths about the fundamental nature of reality. Schafer argues that Hume also endorses meta-normative and meta-philosophical variants of anti-rationalism. The former denies that reason should play a central part in explaining the nature and sources of normative and evaluative distinctions. The latter denies, or at least downplays, the significance of concepts such as reason and reasoning in philosophy.
There is, however, reason to think that Hume does not endorse meta-philosophical anti-rationalism. He repeatedly argues that certain of our commitments, such as moral judgment, belief in an external world, and the supposition of nature's uniformity, are not products of reason. Unlike the meta-philosophical anti-rationalist, Hume takes such conclusions to be philosophically important. Indeed, there is some tension between meta-philosophical anti-rationalism and the other forms of anti-rationalism. By the lights of meta-philosophical anti-rationalism, those forms of anti-rationalism are of little or no significance.
Contemporary discussions of skepticism frequently focus on a style of argument inspired by Descartes’s first Meditation. The argument concludes that one does not know that some quotidian state of affairs obtains from the conjunction of the premises (i) that one does not know that some global skeptical scenario does not obtain and (ii) that such knowledge is required for knowledge that the quotidian state of affairs obtains. In “Avoiding the Unexpected Circuit: Humean Improvements on Standard ‘Cartesian’ Skepticism”, Yuval Avnur argues that Section 12 of the first Enquiry contains an argument for external-world skepticism that differs from the Cartesian argument.
Hume claims that no argument that “the perceptions of the senses [are] produced by external objects, resembling them” is available (EU 12.12). According to the Humean argument, because there is neither a priori nor a posteriori reason for thinking that the causes of one’s perceptions resemble them, one has no epistemic reason for believing—and, hence, does not know—that the causes of one’s perceptions resemble them. Avnur argues that several prominent responses to the Cartesian argument, such as Dretske’s (1970) closure denial, are ineffective against the Humean argument, moreover, that the Humean argument better captures the heart of the skeptical problematic. A question for Avnur is whether resemblance is the relation in terms of which the Humean argument is most effectively framed. The appeal to resemblance may limit the skeptical force of the argument's conclusion. I do not know that my auditory or olfactory perceptions, for example, resemble their causes, but this does not seem to preclude my achieving knowledge of the world through those perceptions.
Another contribution that concerns Hume's relation to skepticism is Duncan Pritchard’s “Hume and Wittgenstein on Naturalism and Scepticism”. Pritchard’s target is P.F. Strawson’s (1985) claim that Hume and the later Wittgenstein each offer a naturalistic response to skepticism, according to which there are certain fundamental commitments that, as a matter of our psychological constitution, are non-optional for us. Pritchard agrees that this sort of response is present in Hume. But he argues that the core of Wittgenstein’s response does not appeal to the unavoidability of certain commitments but instead to the idea that the skeptic’s attempt at a global evaluation of the rationality of our commitments is ultimately unintelligible. According to Pritchard, this response, unlike Hume’s naturalism, is effective against radical skepticism as a paradox, which does not require actual doubt but only recognition that the skeptic’s argument presents a tension in our ordinary ways of thinking about knowledge.
In “Conceivability as the Standard of Metaphysical Possibility”, Miren Boehm offers a novel interpretation of Hume's modal epistemology. Boehm argues for an “attributional” reading of Hume's conceivability principle (CP): “nothing of which we can form a clear and distinct idea is absurd and impossible” (T 1.1.7.6). According to this reading, Hume holds that “we ascribe metaphysical possibility on the basis of conceivability” (243).
This does not itself resolve familiar worries concerning the CP: why think that conceivability is a guide to the world’s modal structure? But such worries are inapposite for Hume. As Boehm effectively shows, he takes metaphysical possibility and necessity to consist in facts involving conception, namely, mental liberty and determination. Further, Boehm argues, against Donald Ainslie (2015), that Hume can explain our possessing a distinct idea of metaphysical possibility: it is an idea copied from the feeling of the imagination’s liberty.
One question is whether our possessing an idea of possibility that is non-identical with the idea of the state of affairs conceived to be possible is in tension with Hume’s assertion that “whatever the mind conceives includes the idea of possible existence” (T 1.2.2.8, emphasis modified). Because distinct ideas are separable according to Hume, Boehm’s account seems to imply that one can conceive of a state of affairs without including the idea of possibility.
I have not had space to discuss many other valuable contributions to the volume, such as Angela Coventry’s discussion of Quinean naturalized epistemology and Hsueh Qu’s resolution of an apparent tension between Hume's epistemology and his doxastic involuntarism. This is a book that anyone interested in Hume and his connections to contemporary epistemology would benefit from reading. It is not quite right that Hume is, as the editors suggest, “essentially an epistemologist” (1). His philosophical concerns are too diverse to be reduced to any one of our disciplinary categories. But the volume shows that epistemology is one conversation in which Hume still has something to say.
REFERENCES
Ainslie, Donald. 2015. Hume’s True Scepticism. Oxford University Press.
Boghossian, Paul. 2018. “Delimiting the Boundaries of Inference.” Philosophical Issues 28: 55-69.
Dretske, Fred. 1970. “Epistemic Operators.” Journal of Philosophy 67 (24): 1007-23.
Hume, David. 2000 An Enquiry Concerning Human Understanding. Edited by Tom L. Beauchamp. Clarendon Press.
–––. 2007. A Treatise of Human Nature. 2 vols. Edited by David Fate Norton and Mary J. Norton. Clarendon Press.
Sextus Empiricus. 2000. Outlines of Scepticism. Translated by Julia Annas and Jonathan Barnes. Cambridge University Press.
Strawson, P.F. 1985. Skepticism and Naturalism: Some Varieties. Columbia University Press.