In the decade since publishing Learning to Die in the Anthropocene, witnessing the steady march of rising global carbon emissions only disrupted temporarily by a world-wide pandemic, Roy Scranton has become even more pessimistic.
In the preface to Impasse: Climate Change and the Limits of Progress, Scranton recounts a family trip to Chaco Canyon. Drawing from sources in the academic literature on collapse, he hypothesizes that complexity itself doomed its once thriving Puebloan civilization. Likewise, “the problem we face with climate change isn’t just unsustainable carbon waste… or metabolic disequilibrium” but complexity itself (xxii). Climate change, he surmises, is not something subject to the management of an intentional and sustainable transition. The only ‘solution’ is simplification, and, as he argues, this is not an actionable solution at all. This predicament constitutes an irresolvable civilizational impasse.
Conventional politics appears predicated on a commitment to the possibility of progress. Roy Scranton’s purpose in writing is, somewhat paradoxically, to elucidate a path forward without progress. His attempt extends earlier work, most notably his influential and provocative 2013 essay, “Learning to Die in the Anthropocene”, that culminated in his 2015 book of the same name. Many perceived this philosophical meditation on the prospect of climate-induced collapse to be a work of profound pessimism. Scranton has since embraced this charge—and Impasse is its apologia.
Following the tone-setting preface and an introduction, Scranton structures Impasse in two parts. The first part, “A Broken Thread”, consists of four chapters written to establish the first central claim of the book: that global civilization has arrived at an impasse, facing a future that is “extremely dangerous and wholly unimaginable” (5). The second part, “The Leap”, presents a vision of what it might look like to live well in an impasse and presents a defense of what he calls ethical pessimism.
Impasse is a work of grand scope, enjoining an extensive history of ideas (Chapter 1) with cutting-edge surveys of philosophy, politics, and economics (Chapter 2-4), regular dives into the psychology of human emotion and motivation (Chapter 2, 5), and theoretical interventions into literary analysis (Chapter 6) and philosophy (Chapter 6, 7). It is emotionally provocative and intellectually generative, blending wide-ranging scholarly knowledge with powerful prose. I cannot hope to do full justice to Scranton’s important work in this short review, but in what follows, I offer critical reflections on some core conceptual matters before discussing implications for politics and ethics.
Core Conceptual Matters
There are two central concepts defended in Impasse. The first is the concept of ‘impasse’ itself, and the second is the concept of ‘pessimism’. Elucidating both ideas serves as the book’s primary theoretical contribution.
The Puebloans at Chaco Canyon could be seen to face a prototypical impasse. Drawing from the work of the anthropologist Jospeh Tainter, Scranton suggests that Puebloan civilization reached a point where the rising energy costs of complexity paired with diminishing returns render “simplification… more economical than additional complexity” (xvii). At this point, there are only three possibilities: discovery of new energy, slow managed simplification, or rapid unmanaged simplification. On this understanding, it is intuitive why anthropogenic climate change might herald an impasse for global civilization.
Yet, notice that, on this meaning of ‘impasse’, whether the world currently stands at its edge depends on whether growing global energy demands can be met while generating more value than is lost. This is a robustly empirical and value-laden matter, but one that by my judgement Scranton does not sufficiently motivate. Even as the last decade has made Scranton more pessimistic, by at least some metrics things have improved in that time. There is a growing consensus among climate scientists and policymakers that worst-case scenarios of 4.5°C+ temperature rise are now unlikely (Jehn, et al. 2022). This is, in part, due to a degree of increased policy action and the falling cost of renewable energy.
Scranton might rejoin—and I would agree—that this ‘progress’ is not enough. The Climate Action Tracker still estimates 2.6°C temperature rise assuming current policies, nearly doubling the 1.5°C degree target agreed upon in Paris and rocketing us into a drier, more dangerous, and deeply unfamiliar world. And the impacts will not be felt equitably: as low-lying islands sink below the ocean’s surface, funding earmarked for mitigation is redirected to adaptation and geoengineering done in service of the global elite, and the interests of the future and our fellow species fade ever more into the background of climate emergency. This scenario is as alive today as it was a decade ago.
This brings us to the matter of pessimism. Foregrounding climate change in the book reflects how, for Scranton, the climate crisis colors his pessimism, but I propose it is better to understand his pessimism as coloring his view of climate. Scranton understands philosophical pessimism as “a critique made by reason against reason, arguing that the capacity for human beings to change things for the better is doubtful at best” (171). The power of our technology is only as good as we are, and we often aren’t so good. So, too, our innovations and improvements will fail us in managing the global climate.
If this is right, Impasse is not primarily about climate change at all, but about a deeper truth that climate symbolizes just as well as an ancestral ruin. In this fundamental way, as Scranton hints in the Afterword, “the subject is a pretext” (217). But what is this truth? It depends on which pessimism. Throughout the book, Scranton slides seamlessly between strong and weak forms. Sometimes, he seems to speak of a profound pessimism that resigns itself to the unalterable wretchedness of the world in a fashion that even pessimism’s philosophical father Voltaire never could truly accept. Other times, he speaks of an eco-pessimism “indistinguishable from mainstream ecology” that holds only that there “are real ecological limits to human flourishing” (165) or proposes pessimism may be captured by the commonsense wisdom of the Serenity Prayer (208).
Ultimately, the question roundly left unanswered by the book’s end is whether a good pessimist should believe that there are limits to progress or that progress itself is always impossible. This might matter a whole lot for the politics to follow.
Politics
The transhumanist F.M. Esfandiary begins his 1973 manifesto Upwingers with an ode to optimism that reflects Scranton’s project like a funhouse mirror. “I have often been told that I am too optimistic about the future. How can anyone be too optimistic? My regret is that I am not optimistic enough” (2). Even as many sympathetic to the young environmental movement worried about the growing signs of human-induced ecological destruction, Esfandiary believed that the last few decades had brought radical human progress that would continue.
Esfandiary’s primary ambition in writing was no less than upending the traditional political spectrum of left/right. He insisted we needed a 90-degree axial rotation to the politics of the “Up” and “Down”: a clash of those who look to the skies and dream of mastering the universe and those who look to the earth and embrace their terrestrial bonds. In a 2013 essay for Aeon, the social epistemologist Steve Fuller revived this view, insisting that a battle between the “Up” and “Down” wing would define the politics of the future.
In a warming world where AI now “powers” everything from our photo-editing software and search engines to baby carriages, and Elon Musk colonizes the near-earth atmosphere almost on his own, while activists decry cannibal capitalism, rebel against extinction, and plea for ecological liberation, it’s easy to think Esfandiary and Fuller have a point. And, for both, the choice between which to champion is not difficult. On their view, only the Up-wing demonstrates any real commitment to progressivism. According to the former, the Down-wing amounts to a “back-to-earth purism—a reactionary resistance to all progress” (Esfandiary, 1973, 38). For Fuller, the Down-wing’s belief in the idea of ‘natural limits’ abandons the modern Left’s political commitment to large-scale social transformation.
Roy Scranton disagrees. In Impasse, he scrutinizes a family of definitively Down-wing thinking, characterized by a belief that “modern humanity lives in a fallen state and that prelapsarian human life was qualitatively better” (119). He accuses this political alignment of affirming a myth of renewal and thereby extending the myth of progress: a story that “human action can improve the general conditions of human life” (38). In his words, just as modern civilization is incapable of saving itself through technological mastery, we are also “incapable of rewilding ourselves, uncivilizing, going native, or decolonizing the Anthropocene” (122). He has no doubt this latter path would be preferable, but he insists it is impossible. It refuses to face our impasse.
This raises several crucial questions. Can there be politics at all without a commitment to the possibility of progress? Can there be a politics of pessimism? In several places, Scranton seems to suppose not. In the Introduction, he states the pessimist position does not easily support revolutionary or liberatory politics, even as it does not oppose them. But is this right? Doesn’t pessimism render political action and organization irrational? In the very next sentence, he identifies an “unbridgeable gap” between meaningful social change and the time we have left (7). Later, he rejects the politics of many Down-wingers by insisting their radical ends require violence amounting to a ‘global genocide’ (127).
But, once again, whether a politics of pessimism is possible depends on answering “which pessimism?”. Even as Scranton sometimes rejects much Down-wing thought as progressivist, at other times, he includes an incredible number of figures in the counter-tradition of ‘philosophical pessimism’: from David Hume and W.E.B Du Bois to Ralph Waldo Emerson, Mark Twain, Wendell Berry, and contemporary theorists such as Jane Bennett and Donna Haraway. Yet few, if any, of these figures would accept Scranton’s strong anti-political bent. In this way, his flavor of pessimism may be exceptionally strong, if not idiosyncratic.
Ethics
It is only across a few pages near the very end of the book that Scranton finally addresses ethics directly. This is somewhat surprising, as his vision of a virtue ethics of ‘ethical pessimism’ plays a pronounced role in the introduction, and many of his arguments against revolutionary politics seem tacitly moral. If collective disruption is more likely to incur grand suffering than lasting transformative change, it is morally wrong to bring about. In this way, Scranton surmises, “expecting less from the world and the people in it helps one cultivate sympathy, patience, and generosity” while “favoring humility and forgiveness” (209).
Unfortunately, readers hoping for a systematic treatment of ethical pessimism will have to look elsewhere, as Scranton says little more. And what he does say is unsatisfactory. It is not obvious that ‘expecting less’ from each other or our governments is what the current moment calls for, nor why egalitarianism falls out of pessimism as he claims. That the pessimist believes “we’re just all muddling through, so we may as well muddle through together” reads as shockingly saccharine for a book that is so often fiercely skeptical of other ethical outlooks or political prescriptions (209).
By my judgement, if Impasse has something important to say about ethics, it is not so much due to any consistent meaning of pessimism but in its rejection of the optimism powering free-market capitalism and so many other forces driving climate catastrophe. On the flip side, Scranton shows, persuasively, that fear and sadness might motivate as much as scenes of success; that humans are hard-wired towards bright-siding, perhaps to our evolutionary advantage and our contemporary detriment; that accepting the inevitability of suffering and the limits of reason need not preclude wise action or mutual care; and that reckoning with our animalistic limitations might be more important than believing, against all evidence to the contrary, business can continue as usual.
What we might need most today, in other words, is not a dogmatic belief in progress or its absence but rather a steadfast hope, rooted in the recognition that in knowing what we can’t know, we might yet be surprised.
REFERENCES
Esfandiary, F. M. (1973). Up-wingers: A futurist manifesto. John Day Company.
Jehn, F. U., Kemp, L., Ilin, E., Funk, C., Wang, J. R., & Breuer, L. (2022). Focus of the IPCC assessment reports has shifted to lower temperatures. Earth's Future, 10, e2022EF002876. https://doi.org/10.1029/2022EF002876.
ACKNOWLEDGMENTS
I extend gratitude to Linde De Vroey and Ben Wagner for their helpful comments on an early draft of this review.