Is This God’s Country? offers a wide-ranging exploration of important issues at the intersection of religion and democratic politics. Robert Audi’s publication record spans an impressive array of topics, including (among other things) business ethics, healthcare, and the ethics of citizenship, and his book reflects that diversity of thought. Part I reviews philosophical foundations of the separation of church and state, Part II discusses the concrete implications of what that separation does (or does not) entail in education, business, and healthcare, and Part III examines norms of democratic discourse, particularly as they pertain to religious advocacy. As a whole, Audi’s arguments support a liberal (rather than a conservative) approach to religion and politics, but he goes out of his way to try to show how such a broadly liberal approach can accommodate religious liberties and concerns. Given the breadth of material the book covers—along with the fact that it aims to be accessible to a general audience and is just over a hundred pages—the extent of the analysis of individual topics is necessarily limited. The book may thus be especially suited for lay readers seeking a preliminary overview of questions relevant to the study of religion and democracy. However, it may also be helpful to advanced researchers who want a brief in-way to Audi’s wider body of work.
Audi opens and closes the book by addressing the question that titles the book: is America God’s country? This question has recently been made relevant by Christian nationalists who are militant in asserting a particular kind of positive answer to it (Wolfe, 2022). It has not, however, received much explicit attention in contemporary, mainstream political philosophy. Audi’s discussion thus provides a welcome response to that movement.
In his opening chapter, Audi outlines four different senses in which a nation may be religious: demographically, culturally, ethically, and theologically. The ‘ethical’ and ‘theological’ senses of religiosity have to do with the degree to which a nation “realizes” (12) or “embodies” (13) religious standards of ethics and theological doctrines. Audi is not entirely clear about whether he has in mind legal manifestations of those standards and doctrines, or other ways in which they may be expressed in social or political norms. This ambiguity aside, a nation could clearly be demographically and even culturally religious—for instance, by having a majority of Christian citizens who express their faith in public ways—without necessarily having laws that are based on sectarian elements of any religious worldview. Instead, Audi proposes that laws should be regulated by the values of liberty, equality, and neutrality towards religion (27–31). He also briefly discusses and rejects the under-explored idea that these values may be compatible with a proportional, power-sharing arrangement in which members of different religious and philosophical groups are guaranteed certain government offices (26, 30).
By the close of the book, Audi offers a novel way of understanding how even a country that does not have an establishment of religion could, in a certain sense, be theologically and ethically Christian. He suggests that that may be possible if Christian theology and ethics is itself understood in an ecumenical way—so that, e.g., it puts a strong focus on “Loving thy neighbor as thyself”, encourages tolerance of other religious and philosophical worldviews, and supports a separation of church from state (134–5). Audi’s suggestion here helps add substance to John Rawls’s somewhat vague hope that religious citizens can, from within the basis of their diverse traditions, form an overlapping consensus on democratic values and institutions. Audi’s account is also a helpful corrective to the misconception—which sometimes seems to be presupposed by Christian nationalist groups—that a country that does not have laws based on particular, contested elements of Christian theology must therefore lack any kind of basis in Christian values.
Part II addresses a variety of applied issues in education, the economy, and healthcare. Audi tries to show (among other things) how teachers can introduce evolutionary biology in a way that is respectful to religion (41–6), that vouchers can be compatible with church-state separation (46–51), and that only closely held companies may be engage in some measure of ‘establishment’ of religion within their organization (55–63). He also offers some parameters for adjudicating the proper role of religion in sports and the fine arts (52–3), and as a grounds for resistance to vaccines (89–91).
Audi’s most sustained discussion of an applied issue is on abortion. He argues for a strong pro-choice view, largely on the basis of the claim that democracies should treat personhood as arising at live birth (70ff, 102–5). Audi offers some religious basis for this claim (75) and resists the idea that we should prefer religious views that locate ensoulment at birth (X). A more central argument, however, focuses on the idea that if the developing creature in the womb “is a person with all the basic rights persons have, then government should. . .be concerned with whether there should be all the legal rights that go with being a person” (77). It should, for instance, be concerned to recalculate the population, extend tax deductions, and re-write inheritance tax laws (77–78). Audi takes it that the government should not be concerned with latter, and infers that it thus cannot consistently maintain that the fetus is a person before birth. While this argument certainly provokes thought, it’s unclear to me that it is successful. We certainly regard children as persons, but we also recognize that their status as persons does not entail that they should have all the legal rights of adults. So also those who regard the fetus as a person might resist the idea that that status entails that the fetus must have all the legal recognitions appropriate to a child post-birth.
Part III of Audi’s book continues his past work on the ethics of democratic citizenship. Audi proposes a principle of natural reason which holds that citizens have a legally non-enforceable, prima facie obligation only to advocate for coercive laws for which they can offer adequate natural reasons in support. A natural reason is (roughly) one that “can be appreciated by any normal moderately educated adult” (109) and our capacities for natural reasoning more generally include, e.g., our capacities for perception, recognition of the badness of pain (and the goodness of pleasure), and powers of inference. The principle of natural reason may in certain regards privilege secular forms of argument over religious ones in the public sphere, but—departing from early discussions of the political ethics of religious advocacy (see, e.g., Rawls 2005; Audi, 2000)—Audi makes a concerted effort to accommodate religious concerns. First, he points out that our capacity for natural reason may be understood as a feature of being created in the image of God. Second, he emphasizes that “there is no inconsistency in saying a lot about one’s religious position while adhering to the principle of natural reason” (114). Indeed, he pairs the principle of natural reason with a principle of religious rationale, which holds that religious citizens also have a prima facie obligation to offer adequate religious reasons for the coercive laws they support (115). This view of religious advocacy falls broadly in line with other contemporary approaches which welcome citizens’ contribution of religious reasons, while still stressing that laws should have religiously neutral grounds of support (Laborde, 2017; Rawls, 2005; Vallier 2014; 2015).
Audi also claims that the obligation to provide natural reasons is only prima facie, and so that it may be overridden by conflicting considerations (110). It may be that Audi means that any particular individual only has a prima facie obligation to articulate such reasons at the time of her advocacy, but that nevertheless (following along with Rawls’s proviso (“The Idea of Public Reason Revisited” 2005)) in the long run any law must ultimately be able to be supported by adequate, religiously neutral reasons.[1] Audi is not clear about this, and without such further specification his argument presents an interesting concession to those who are critical of the attempt to ground democratic laws in religiously neutral reasons. Such critics—who typically target public reason views that bear some similarity to Audi’s view—argue that we should not always insist on having religiously neutral reasons for laws, either (among other things) because such neutral reasons ‘run out’ when it comes to deciding on specific legislation (Eberle 2002, 123-24; 217-19; Coetsee, forthcoming) or because, more generally, the mutual acceptability of laws should be seen merely as one among other desiderata (Enoch 2015). A merely prima facie obligation to offer natural reasons could accommodate both sorts of concerns. However, such a prima facie obligation also generates new challenges. Even theocrats can recognize that there are some good reasons to offer justifications for laws that citizens from non-religious backgrounds could accept. So a liberal democrat who settles for a merely prima facie obligation to support laws on the basis of religiously neutral reasons must offer further norms for how that obligation should be appropriately balanced against others within a democratic framework.
Overall, Is This God’s Country represents a unique attempt to cover a wide scope of pressing issues relevant to religion and democratic politics. It raises important questions and offers some interesting and thought-provoking answers. While some of the arguments would benefit from more detailed coverage, interested readers may profitably seek those out in Audi’s other published work.
REFERENCES
Stephen Wolfe, The Case for Christian Nationalism (Canon Press, 2022).
John Rawls, Political Liberalism, Expanded ed (New York: Columbia University Press, 2005).
Robert Audi, Religious Commitment and Secular Reason (Cambridge University Press, 2000).
Cécile Laborde, Liberalism’s Religion (Cambridge, Massachusetts: Harvard University Press, 2017).
John Rawls, “The Idea of Public Reason Revisited,” in Political Liberalism, Expanded ed, Columbia Classics in Philosophy (New York: Columbia University Press, 2005), 440–90.
Kevin Vallier, Liberal Politics and Public Faith: Beyond Separation (Routledge, 2014).
Kevin Vallier, “Public Justification versus Public Deliberation: The Case for Divorce,” Canadian Journal of Philosophy45, no. 2 (2015): 139–58.
Christopher J. Eberle, Religious Conviction in Liberal Politics (Cambridge University Press, 2002).
Marilie Coetsee, “In Defense of Strong Deliberation,” in Does Faith Belong in Politics? Debating Religious Participation in a Pluralistic Polity (with Paul Billingham; Routledge, forthcoming).
David Enoch, “Against Public Reason,” in Oxford Studies in Political Philosophy, Volume 1, ed. David Sobel, Peter Vallentyne, and Steven Wall (Oxford University Press, 2015).
[1] The following example Audi provides supports this reading. He writes that if the passage of a law that would stop a fanatics’ attack on a stadium depends on a mayor’s appealing to religious reasons, then she should be able to appeal to those reasons (110). In this case there would surely be adequate, religiously neutral reasons that could in principle provide adequate support for such a law.