Johann Gottfried Herder. Ideas for the Philosophy of the History of Mankind

If we would philosophize about the history of our species, let us therefore reject as far as possible all narrow forms of thought originating in the constitution of one region of the earth or the doctrines of a single school. (17)

Johann Gottfried von Herder’s Ideas for the Philosophy of the History of Mankind is a monumental work, and so is this masterful translation—the first in over a century—by Gregory Martin Moore. Herder’s thought is one of the central forces that shaped nearly every aspect of German intellectual life from about 1770 until well after the turn of the century. He studied under Immanuel Kant at the University of Königsberg, where he also came under the influence of his teacher's friendly rival, the eccentric anti-rationalist Johann Georg Hamann. Both left indelible marks on his philosophical outlook. Over his long career, Herder interacted, often in a decisive way, with almost every leading philosopher, poet, historian, and theologian of the German Enlightenment, eventually joining the inner circle of Weimar Classicism, alongside Wieland, Schiller, and Goethe. His massive literary output, of which still only a moderate selection exists in English, is itself far too extensive and diverse to describe here. Most notable are his contributions to aesthetics, psychology, anthropology, philosophy of language, political and cultural criticism, and biblical hermeneutics, along with his advancement of the study of folk traditions.^[1] Towards the end of his life, he also published two full books aimed at curing the “transcendental influenza” he saw as arising from Kant’s critical philosophy (1955, XII).

Ideas for the Philosophy of the History of Mankind (1784–1791), published during his Weimar period, is a foundational text of Herder’s entire philosophical project. To see this, however, we must briefly recall the broader context of German philosophy during Herder’s formative years. By the time he began studying under Kant, the hegemony of Christian Wolff’s philosophy had crumbled under the combined criticism of Newtonians and philosophers of the British, French, and German empiricist traditions. Many of the leading lights of the younger generation—Johann Lambert, Johann Nicolaus Tetens, and the young Kant, to name a few—sought original ways to enrich what they saw as the necessary but as yet sterile Wolffian rigor with the methods of Newtonian science and the rich “science of man” popularized in Alexander Pope’s Essay on Man and articulated more robustly by such British philosophers as John Locke, George Berkeley, Francis Hutcheson, and David Hume.

As noted by Moore in the Introduction, Herder attempted to achieve this synthesis by establishing his own, entirely new, science of humanity. “The object of that science," Moore explains,

was to discover the laws and purpose of history, not in divine or metaphysical speculation, but in the observable regularities of nature: to extend to the human world those empirical investigations that since Copernicus had yielded insight into the machinery of the universe. (xiv)

Indeed, Herder sought to replace ‘empty’ metaphysical speculation and ‘blind’ historical bookkeeping with a genuinely dynamic principle of equilibrium between the demands of empirical science and the human need for a synoptic vision of the whole.

Although Moore’s Introduction (to which I will return below) provides an excellent historical overview, the particular flavor of Herder’s approach in Ideas can be gathered perhaps most easily from a consideration of the unique problem-space of his generation. That Herder would frame his work as a new Copernican science is no accident. Kant and others had done the same. They were born into a world in which the lessons of historical Copernicansim had led to a seemingly irreconcilable and indeed acrimonious standoff between followers of Newton and Leibniz. The leading lights of the younger generation all seemed to agree that the path forward lay in a revolutionary new synthesis and that this would require a fundamental rethinking of the deeper significance and implications of the original Copernican revolution. The previous two centuries had tried meticulously to reconstruct the magical key by which Copernicus had deciphered the text of the heavens. Due largely to Galileo’s influence, he had come to be regarded as a sort of heroic genius of reason: the sole person bold enough to deny even the evidence of his own senses, to reject what to that point was held to be the first principle of science, and yet also capable of discovering an entirely new criterion of truth.

The general nature of that criterion would take some time to decipher. But the basic shape in the instance at hand was clear enough: It lay in the systematic picture of the solar system that resulted from interpreting the existing data according to the hypothesis that much of the motion seen in the planets ‘secretly’ takes place in the spectator. Thus, what the scientist observes in objects is in fact a combination of objective and subjective factors. Any reliable interpretation of phenomena would therefore seem to require principles for distinguishing the subjective from the objective prior to all empirical evidence. In his Dialogues on the Two Chief World Systems, Galileo asserted that this was the very reason why Aristotelian science failed; its practitioners had not made sure their principles were “secure, firm, and well established” prior to any observation or experiment. Instead, Aristotle “was pulling cards out of his sleeve, and trying to accommodate the architecture to the building instead of modeling the building after the precepts of architecture” (1967, 16).

The subsequent course of rationalism can, from this perspective, be understood in large part as an attempt to secure just such an absolute foundation for science prior to and independently of the evidence of the senses. The apparent inability of rationalism to make sense of Newton's achievement was clearly one of the most powerful reasons that convinced philosophers of Kant’s generation that Wolffian metaphysics, and indeed Leibnizian philosophy generally, needed fundamental reform. Yet Newtonianism had its own serious flaws, requiring the acceptance of unsupported principles of induction, along with at least two unperceivable, metaphysical entities, namely absolute space and absolute time, which were necessary to provide non-relative standards for conceiving the reality of motion. To Herder and others, it also utterly failed to incorporate physical science into a consistent and comprehensive conception of the natural world as both a product and an object of the human mind. The foundations were missing.

The perceived crisis in intelligibility that this occasioned is immediately evident, for example, in Johann Heinrich Lambert's Cosmological Letters, a representative work and one well known to Herder.^[2] If the true standards of space and time are in principle unperceivable, and if whatever standards we adopt are purely assumed and likely to be rejected in the future, then would not the science we build upon them be a fiction? Each cosmological hypothesis—Ptolemy’s, Copernicus’s—could be overturned at the next step, or at one of the indefinitely many after that. Depicting future ages in which Newton and Kepler will be seen as having constructed their “epic poems according to the mythologies of their times,” Lambert concludes: “Insofar as Copernicus made the first step, there remains for us and our descendants still a thousand other steps to take and even then we will not be Copernican by a long shot” (175). Neither Lambert nor Kant were willing to accept this result, and, accordingly, both sought ways to defend the objectivity of science. Herder, however, encouraged especially by Berkeley and Hume, very much embraced that conclusion and saw in this generalized Copernicanism a true ‘revolution of the spirit’, one by which humanity had learned that every supposed system of science can only be a temporary and fictional standpoint, a sort of epic poem, located within an endless chain of past and future revolutions. If there remains a measure of truth for Herder, it lies only in the surface connections and analogies that communicate to us something of the divine plan of the whole. A more correct story will only be one that allows us to better trace the organization and divine instruction contained in that tiny bit of nature that now appears to us.

In Ideas for the Philosophy of the History of Mankind, Herder adopts and seeks to corroborate this generalized Copernicanism while attempting to construct his own epic poem, a philosophical and scientific “history of mankind in general”. The aim of the project is to study humanity and its development up to the modern period and to extract from this the more general dynamic principles of its systematic development. The narrative is divided into four parts. The first aims to uncover how humanity is really constituted and what its purpose must be from an examination of its position within the ‘great chain of being’ and the internal organization of its physical and mental powers. It commences from the specific position and character of the earth as a “Star among Other Stars” (8), concluding that ours is a “middling” world among an otherwise unknowable but inconceivably vast cosmos. And although we have “absolutely no yardstick by which to judge” the heavenly motions, we can see that “We are not in the center, but in the throng; like other worlds ours is borne on the current and we have no standard of comparison” (11). We can also see that our world has been and remains subject to endless development, that all things within it are interdependent, and that our physical and mental powers are suited only for our survival and flourishing within this environment. All our science “is meant only to acquaint us with external relations without leading us the least bit closer to inner being” (31). According to Herder, we learn even that our own

reason [Vernunft] is nothing else than something that is perceived [etwas Vernommenes]: a learned proportion and direction of ideas and powers [Kräfte], for which man was formed consistent with his organization and mode of life. We are no more acquainted with the reason of angles than we are granted an intimate understanding of the interior of some creature below us in the scale; man's reason is human. (92)

The general lesson, which becomes as it were the refrain for the entire book, is one of profound humility in relation to the whole, but also of interconnectedness and dependency alongside every other member of it.

This, however, is only a humiliation for one who has not grasped the true nature of humanity. Like all things, this too has its special character, dignity, and destination. By comparison and analogy with other creatures, particularly their physical structure, Herder determines that the human being is formed only for humanity, i.e., for the full development of its own unique dispositions and powers in all their possible varieties. To this humanity belong the development of language, reason, and freedom (a sort of self-determination not limited to instinct), and ultimately of the means to self-preservation, sympathy (“Nature has made man the most sympathetic of all living things,” p. 100), and communication with others. These lead in turn to society, an inward understanding of justice and truth, and a sense of propriety commensurate with humanity itself. The final purpose, the “highest humanity of man”, is however found only in religion, which for Herder seems to consist simply in a fully developed understanding of humanity and of its proper place within the whole. Philosophy, guided by the analogy of nature, does not reveal more than this, though it does give grounds for hope of a continued existence after death (106).

This first part establishes the method and basic principles for those subsequent. Using the same sort of analogical reasoning, the second part attempts to establish the specific principles of the organization and development of humanity in history. Like humanity in general, every particular formation is that same essence as it appears under specific circumstances and within a specific environment. Each has its center and specific form of happiness within itself, and each is of equal dignity and worth. Still, observation and analogy teach us that all these forms developed out of one origin in Asia and that their interconnectedness as well as internal variety refutes any supposed concept of race: “The colors run into one another; the forms are dictated by the genetic character; and on the whole all ultimately become shades of one and the same picture, spread over every age and every place on earth” (169). All differences of a physical, cultural, political, or spiritual nature must be traced to differences of climate and history, including especially those affecting the development of languages. The lesson of this second part is substantially the same as the first: History reveals one and the same humanity at work, with the same powers and religious aims, but also as developing organically into a great variety of unique and self-determining forms.

With this framework in place, Herder turns in the third part to the historical development of individual peoples, religions, cultures, nations, sciences, and technologies, from the earliest known civilizations to the fall of ancient Rome. He concludes that the historical development of humanity reveals that the apparent antagonisms and destructive forces serve for the providential development of reason and equity, the laws by which humanity itself becomes healthy and endures. As Herder explains,

The rule that sustains the solar system and forms every crystal, every worm, and every snowflake, forms and sustains mankind also: it made its own nature the basis of the continued existence and activity, for as long as they shall be. All the works of God both subsist in themselves and are connected with one another in the most exquisite manner: for they all repose, within their definite limits, on the equilibrium of conflicting forces, brought to order by means of an inner agency [innere Macht]. (451)

So while there is a general equality in the dignity of individuals and cultures, such that “no individual may suppose that he exists for the sake of another or of posterity,” Herder admits of no moral relativism: The observation of nature's organization, which is nothing but the use of reason, is sufficient to instill an understanding of the good even in the "lowest ranks of men”. And if a person “obeys the law of reason and equity that lies within him, then he has consistency; that is, he enjoys well-being and continuance; he is rational, equitable, and happy” and “not by the decree of his fellow creatures, or of the Creator, but in consequence of the laws prevailing in a universal, self-grounded order of Nature” (449).

The fourth part continues only up to the Middle Ages and ends abruptly. Herder never completed the final volume, although he left behind a brief outline of its projected contents (613–614). Philosophically, this fourth part does not add to what is found elsewhere in the work and will, I suspect, be of interest only to historians of historical narratives.

Regarding this edition: As a fellow translator, I can only admire Moore's achievement. Leaving aside the incredible length of the book, he spoils us with an elegantly written Introduction, a lean but sufficient explanation of his translation method and choices, and well over seventy pages of scholarly notes. Richly textured with historical references and insights, the first of these provides the publication history of Ideas, a partial account of its influence, a comparison with similar works in the genre of philosophical history, and a helpful part-by-part outline of the book itself. Particularly notable, is Moore’s claim that Ideas holds a special place within history writing due largely to its scope, and within Herder’s own corpus, because in it he shows his “willingness to declare not only that history unfolds according to a divine plan, which earlier he was only prepared to concede might be glimpsed through a glass darkly, but also that we may know it” (xxxvi). Though brief, the description of Herder’s relation to Kant (liv-lvii), written from a fresh perspective, is also interesting.

Turning to the notes, these alone provide the attentive reader with an education in Herder's influences and historical sources. Authors or works mentioned by Herder, even if only in passing, receive short biographies or descriptions, and specific references are often expanded with quotations that Moore has excavated and translated from the original works. Finally, the translation itself I found to be unflaggingly accurate and consistent throughout, while reading very naturally, and often even matching the grandeur of Herder's original prose. I particularly appreciate that Moore provides the original German within brackets whenever the translation might arguably obscure important philosophical connections.

This translation of Herder's Ideas for the Philosophy of the History of Mankind will be indispensable reading for anyone who wishes to understand the development of German literature, linguistics, theology, or philosophy after 1770. Herder’s views on certain religions, on gender, and on race are, to be sure, heavily influenced by the age in which he wrote, and—to state what should be obvious—no reader today will find all his judgments appropriate or defensible. Yet, as a whole and taken in context, the work contains a profound and still deeply compelling vision of how we ought to regard ourselves and our fellow human beings in light of the lessons of modern science. For those without a specialist interest in German intellectual history, it can be strongly recommended for its many beautiful meditations on human existence, and as one of the best, if still imperfect, examples of humanist literature in the philosophical tradition.

REFERENCES

Gregory Martin Moore, Selected Writings on Aesthetics, Princeton University Press (2006).

Gregory Martin Moore, Shakespeare, Princeton University Press (2008).

Michael N. Foster (trans. and ed.), Herder: Philosophical Writings, Cambridge University Press (2002).

Ioannis D. Evrigenis and Daniel Pellerin (trans.), Another Philosophy of History and Selected Political Writings, Hackett, (2004).

Jason Gaiger (trans. and ed.), Sculpture: Some Observations on Shape and Form from Pygmalion's Creative Dream, University of Chicago Press, (2002).

Philip V. Bohlman (comp. and trans.), Song Loves the Masses: Herder on Music and Nationalism, University of California Press, (2017).

John K. Noyes (ed.), Essay on Being: A Translation and Critical Approaches, Rochester: Camden House, (2018).

John K. Noyes (trans.), Letters for the Advancement of Humanity, Cambridge University Press, (2026).

Johann Gottfried Herder, Kalligone, hrsg. Heinz Begenau (Hermann Böhlaus Nachfolger, Weimer: 1955).

Galileo Galilei, Dialogue Concerning the Two Chief World Systems: Ptolemaic and Copernican, trans. Stillman Drake (Berkeley: University of California Press, 1953; rev. ed. 1967).

J. H. Lambert, Cosmological Letters, trans. Stanley L. Jaki (Edinburgh: Scottish Academic Press, 1976).