Michael Festl has edited a stimulating and wide-ranging collection of essays on the relevance of John Dewey’s philosophy of education, which should engage anyone with a stake in Dewey’s social and political philosophy, the philosophy of education, and what are nervously packaged as “current challenges” to democracy—one of the challenges being deep and violent dissensus around how to describe these challenges.
The collection is organised into three parts. In the first, on “Dewey’s Theory of Education: Then and Now”, Jeff Frank discusses the perceived threatening character of Dewey’s so-called “method of intelligence”. Maura Striano explores the relationship between Dewey and his friend and collaborator, Jane Addams. Filippo Sanna puts Dewey in conversation with the perfectionist ethics of Stanley Cavell.
In part II, “Dewey and Contemporary Challenges in Education: Political and Technological,” Jürgen Oelkers discusses the relationship between contemporary populism and democratic education. Agnieszka Hensoldt reconstructs the Polish educationalist Sergius Hessen’s philosophy of education, considers parallels to Dewey’s thought, and reviews the challenges facing the Polish educational system over the last hundred years. Julian Culp considers the prospects for a Deweyan approach to public deliberation in the landscape of highly fragmented, digitised public spheres. David Hildebrand reviews the transformations wrought on the Deweyan category of experience by the surveillance capitalism of digital technologies, arguing that the task for education is to teach both the skills of public inquiry and the excesses of private technologies.
In part III, “Applying Dewey’s theory of Education Today: Novelties and Reenactments”, Maria Miraglia argues for a conception of anarchist pedagogy in the face of political and economic upheaval. Embracing a Deweyan conception of democracy as a way of life, Bettina Hollstein argues for a pedagogy in business schools and universities attuned to a dialogue among stakeholders. Leonard Waks argues that Dewey’s theory of art and aesthetic education can help resolve current issues in art education.
As I hope this outline suggests, the book contains a rich variety of content, and I strongly recommend it to anyone with an interest in any of its themes. Since it isn’t sensible to discuss individual chapters in detail, I will restrict the rest of this review to an observation about the overall framing of the collection and to a question that I think that this collection and these essays raise.
In the introduction, Festl suggests that a twentieth century liberal philosophy of education, shaped by the horrors of totalitarianism, aimed at neutrality among citizens’ theories of the good. Neutrality is viewed as a form of scepticism about indoctrination and shared by critics of state intervention, such as F. A. Hayek, and proponents of economic redistribution, such as John Rawls, who nevertheless rejects the idea that public policy, including education policy, should be based on a particular conception of the good. Accordingly, public education must eschew instilling any particular liberal or democratic worldview.
The recent threats to and undermining of liberal and democratic polities (“without needing to list the most notorious examples”) suggest that
this educational abstinence concerning theories of the good and teaching substantial democratic values has gone too far. It likely drives the current crisis of democracy. After all, a significant number of the people who came of age when the post-World War II downscaling of democratic education took over seem to no longer support the democratic nation-state with its traditional allegiances. (1)
This provides the hook for considering the more normatively robust conception of education that John Dewey develops in texts such as Democracy and Education (1916) and others. Dewey is unafraid to tie his conception of education to the defence of what he calls democracy as a way of life. Although neither Festl nor his contributors make this point, this framing shares with recent important critiques of liberalism, such as Samuel Moyn’s impatience with a minimalist, sceptical, Cold War liberalism and sympathy for what Moyn identifies as the “pedagogic” tradition of liberal thinking, to which Mill and Dewey (and, more recently, Habermas) belong.
I am not sure this framing is shared by all the authors to this collection—which is in itself unsurprising given the diversity of contributors and their interests—and it is, in any case, vulnerable to some objections. The framing is problematic, partly because it skips over the difficult cases (such as Wisconsin vs. Yoder) that form the focus of the debate between neutralist and perfectionist or comprehensive liberals in relation to education (and these cases and issues aren’t discussed in any of the chapters that follow) and partly because, of course, it involves an important but unestablished empirical claim about the political sociology of right-wing populism.
It also suggests that Dewey viewed public education as a site for the inculcation of a particular set of civic values, which is true only in the indirect sense that (as Frank’s chapter in particular brings out) his conception of growth is aligned with his nonpolitical conception. It further suggests that he supported, or at least was committed to, bulldozing alternative (for example, religious, forms of schooling that didn’t support these values, which is not true. The relationship between Dewey’s democratic political philosophy and forms of liberal pluralism in education is delicate and not captured in this kind of dichotomy. It also isn’t very directly discussed in any of the contributions (although it is relevant to many of them, including at least Frank, Sanna, Culp, and Hildebrand).
The question springs from a well-established worry about Dewey—going back to Reinhold Niebuhr and forward to Sheldon Wolin—that he doesn’t pay enough attention to power in his social philosophy, as opposed to communication, deliberation, growth, education, liberalism, and so on. While there are nuanced responses to this in the literature that go a long way to qualify this view, many of the chapters here—especially to the degree that they align with Festl’s agenda—in effect resurrect this concern in a sharp form. A pincer movement of an emboldened nationalist agenda in schools and universities (Oelkers, Hensoldt) together with the political economy of a digitized public sphere (Hildebrand, Culp) make this a harsh environment to sustain or launch Deweyan-minded democratic pedagogies (Miraglia, Hollstein, Waks).
That the latter provides a critique of the former is important, of course, but perhaps does not need emphasis. Given the fragility of Deweyan social philosophy in the face of power, why look to it at this particular moment, when the problems posed seem centrally to be questions of power? What, if anything, does a Deweyan approach have to say about this, as opposed to, or beyond, the development of critical standards of judgement or alternative pedagogies? This isn’t a negative point about the quality of this book, of course, but it is, I think, a concern that it raises for anyone sympathetic to its agenda.
REFERENCES
Samuel Moyn, Liberalism Against Itself: Cold War Liberalism and the Making of Our Times. New Haven: Yale University Press, 2024