Moses Maimonides’ Guide to the Perplexed (or “Guide of the Perplexed” or “Guide for the Perplexed”), in the original Arabic Dalālat al-Ḥāʾirīn, completed in Cairo in 1191, was the most influential book in medieval Jewish philosophy. It was the last great work of the strict Arabic Aristotelian tradition founded by the Muslim Alfarabi, and served as a cornerstone in the Christian Aristotelian tradition founded by Albert the Great and Thomas Aquinas. It is a notoriously difficult book to translate. It is written in a rich, erudite, and often recondite literary Arabic, generously peppered with Hebrew and Aramaic words. However, it presents itself as a series of epistles addressed to a favorite student, and thus its idiom is often colloquial. In addition, Maimonides had a penchant for philosophic puzzles, and readers today still debate how to solve them.
In spite of these difficulties, the Guide has been translated often. The story of these translations is told in a panoptic volume edited by Josef Stern, James Robinson, and Yonatan Shemesh (2019). Two Hebrew translations, both titled Moreh ha-Nevukhim, were made in the early 13th century: a literal one by the philosopher Samuel ibn Tibbon (1204, rev. 1213) and a literary one by the poet Judah Alharizi (1213). The former was used by most Jewish philosophers, including Baruch Spinoza, Moses Mendelssohn, and Solomon Maimon. The book was translated anonymously into Latin as Dux neutrorum (c. 1240), based on Alharizi’s Hebrew. A second Latin translation titled Doctor perplexorum based on Ibn Tibbon’s Hebrew was achieved by Johannes Buxtorf II (1629). There are numerous translations of the Guide into modern languages, but mention should be made of Salomon Munk’s brilliant Arabic-to-French translation, Le Guide des égarés (1866).
The new translation of the Guide is a joint venture by two professors at Vanderbilt University, Lenn E. Goodman of the philosophy department and Phillip I. Lieberman of the Jewish studies department. Prior to their translation, the Guide had twice been rendered in full into English, both times under the title “The Guide of the Perplexed”: first by Michael Friedländer, principal of Jews’ College, London, a preeminent scholar of medieval Jewish literature (1885); and second by Shlomo Pines, professor of philosophy at the Hebrew University of Jerusalem, a renowned expert on the Arabic and Hebrew philosophic traditions (1963). Friedländer’s translation is straightforward and unpretentious, aimed at the ordinary reader. Pines’ translation is resolutely literal and terminologically precise, aimed at the philosophic reader. Both translations have been widely praised. Why then a new translation? The main justification is linguistic. Friedlander and Pines were both Old World scholars with an extraordinary command of oriental, classical, and modern languages, but neither was a native English speaker. The new Goodman-Lieberman translation is by two American-born scholars. Their idiomatic English is more accessible to contemporary anglophones than the bookish language of Friedländer or Pines. It is good that a classic work like the Guide is available in different English translations. Each has its advantages and disadvantages.
Goodman and Lieberman sometimes express criticism of their predecessors. They say that their new translation seeks to steer the reader safely between the “Scylla and Charybdis” of Friedländer and Pines (lx).They seem to mean by this that the former is too exoteric and the latter too esoteric. They repeatedly emphasize that their new translation rejects “radical” interpretations of Maimonides, which they equate with the view that Maimonides’ ultimate loyalty was not to Judaism but to Aristotle, or, alternatively, that his philosophy is at its core similar to Spinozism (lix, lxii, lxxi).
The Goodman-Lieberman translation was published by Stanford University Press together with a companion volume by Goodman, A Guide to The Guide to the Perplexed: A Reader's Companion to Maimonides’ Masterwork. In what follows, I’ll discuss some texts in the new translation, and compare them with the renderings in Friedländer and Pines. I’ll also address Goodman’s Guide to the Guide.
Let’s begin with the book’s title, “Dalālat al-Ḥāʾirīn.” The Arabic title is in the construct state (ʾiḍāfah), and should be translated literally as “The Guide (or the Guidance) of the Perplexed.” The genitive construction is duly preserved in the two medieval Hebrew translations (“Moreh ha-Nevukhim”) and in the two previous English translations (“The Guide of the Perplexed”), although in the popular 1904 edition of Friedländer’s translation the title was changed to the presumably more idiomatic “The Guide for the Perplexed.” Goodman explains that grammar notwithstanding he and Lieberman preferred “The Guide to the Perplexed” over “The Guide of the Perplexed” for two reasons: first, the latter “does not roll off the tongue in English”; and second, the former better expresses the relationship of the author to “the intended beneficiary of the work’s guidance” (lxvii). The first reason concerns style and de gustibus non est disputandum. The second reason, however, is problematic. The Rabbinic scholar, Aharon Lichtenstein, once remarked that it is important to translate Maimonides’ book as “The Guide of the Perplexed,” and not “for the Perplexed” or “to the Perplexed,” since the former title includes Maimonides himself among “the high rank of the perplexed.” As Maimonides boasts in Guide, II, 24 (253): “I am committed enough to inquiry to confess my perplexity here.” In short, the title “Guide to the Perplexed” has its advantages and disadvantages.
Although written in Arabic, the Guide begins and ends with short Hebrew poems. The opening poem (lxxix) may be rendered prosaically as follows: “My knowledge goes forth to guide [lanḥot] the straight way, to pave its road. Lo, everyone who goes astray [ha-toʿeh] in the field of Torah, come follow its path. The unclean and the fool shall not pass over it. It shall be called the way of holiness.” Maimonides tells us here what he intends to do in his book, and why it is so titled. His knowledge will guide us on the straight path. He invites those who have gone astray to follow it, and the Hebrew word he uses for “goes astray” is one that is often used to translate the Arabic ḥāʾir (which can mean not only “perplexed” but also “go astray”; cf. Munk’s title, “Le Guide des égarés”).
Friedländer translates: “My theory aims at pointing out a straight way, at casting up a high-road. Ye who have gone astray in the field of the holy Law, come hither and follow the path which I have prepared. The unclean and the fool shall not pass over it. It shall be called the way of Holiness.”
Pines translates: “My knowledge goes forth to point out the way, To pave straight its road. Lo, everyone who goes astray in the field of Torah, Come and follow its path. The unclean and the fool shall not pass over it. It shall be called Way of Holiness.”
Goodman translates: “If you’re bemused in the Torah’s realm, There’s insight here to guide you. A road well paved toward holiness, That fools won’t find and knaves deny” (lxxix).
Friedländer translates accurately. Pines mistranslates “point out the way” instead of “point out the straight way.” Goodman picks up on the allusion to dalālah (= lanḥot, “to guide you”) but overlooks the allusion to al-ḥāʾirīn” (= ha-toʿeh), and he omits mention of the “straight way.” He in effect replaces Maimonides’ poem with a charming poem of his own, which introduces interesting new elements, and deletes Maimonides’ strong first person voice. From a literary point of view Goodman’s translation of the poem is superior to either Friedländer’s or Pines’, but he achieves this superiority by sacrificing literalness. Again, his translation has its advantages and disadvantages.
One of the most quoted texts in the Guide is that concerning the Prime Mover as Self-Knowledge (al-ʿaql, al-ʿāqil, wa’l-maʿqūl) in Guide, I, 68 (125) (cf. Aristotle, Metaphysics, XII, 7, 1072a–b).
Friedländer translates: “You are acquainted with the well-known principle of the philosophers that God is the intellectus, the ens intelligens, and the ens intelligibile. These three things are in God one and the same, and do not in any way constitute a plurality.”
Pines translates: “You already know that the following dictum of the philosophers with respect to God, may He be exalted, is generally admitted: the dictum being that He is the intellect as well as the intellectually cognizing subject and the intellectually cognized object, and that those three notions form in Him, may He be exalted, one single notion in which there is no multiplicity.”
Goodman and Lieberman translate: “You know the Philosophers’ famous dictum that God is Thought, Thinker, and the Act of Thinking, the three being alike and undifferentiated in Him.”
The Goodman-Lieberman translation is concise and lucid, but ignores nuances in the text dutifully preserved in the translations of Friedländer and Pines. For example, the passive participle maʿqūl is rendered as “Act of Thinking” instead of as “Object of Thought.” The translators also break with the Latinate tradition of translating Aristotle’s nous as “intellect.”
The main ideological difference between the Friedländer and Pines translations concerns the political. Pines’ collaborator, Leo Strauss, the provocative political philosopher, insisted on interpreting Alfarabi, Averroes, and Maimonides primarily within the framework of classical political philosophy, and his approach influenced Pines’ translation.
For example, at Guide, II, 40 (304), Maimonides alludes to Aristotle’s definition of the human being as homo politikos (Nicomachean Ethics I.7.1097b; Politics I.2.1253a). Friedländer translates: “It has already been fully explained that man is naturally a social being [madanī bi-al-ṭabʿ], that by virtue of his nature he seeks to form communities [mujtamaʿ]; man is therefore different from other living beings that are not compelled to combine into communities [al-ijtimāʿ].” Pines, however, translates: “It has been explained with utmost clarity that man is political by nature and that it is his nature to live in society. He is not like the other animals for which society is not a necessity.” Goodman and Lieberman, for their part, translate: “It has been shown as clearly as can be that man is by nature political, that our nature is to live in a society, unlike other animals that need not live together.” Regarding the key technical terms, the Goodman-Lieberman translation rejects Friedländer’s approach and follows Pines (“political,” “society,” “by nature”), but makes stylistic changes.
Similarly, at Guide, III, 27 (420), Maimonides asserts that the immediate aim of the Law is tadbīr al-madīna, where the Arabic madīna reflects the Greek polis. Friedländer translates: “the government of the state.” Pines translates: “the governance of the city.” Goodman and Lieberman translate: “governance of the polity.” Their translation goes even further than Pines’ in underscoring the Greek provenance of Maimonides’ political theory.
Again, at Guide, III, 31 (434), Maimonides writes that the divine commandments concern al-aʿmāl al-siyāsiyya al-madaniyya. Friedländer translates: “social conduct.’’ Pines translates: “political civic actions.” Goodman and Lieberman translate: “practices, political and civic.” Here again their translation is much closer to Pines than to Friedländer.
Goodman and Lieberman, as I have already mentioned, are very wary of “radical” interpretations of Maimonides according to which his primary loyalty is to Aristotle. However, they inexplicably try to soften radical opinions in the Guide, even when those opinions are anti-Aristotelian! Thus, at Guide, II, 24 (253), Maimonides states that the premises of the Aristotelian physical proof of God based on the motion of the heavenly spheres (Aristotle, Physics, VIII, 5–6, 256a–260a) are “inaccessible” and “far beyond our reach,” that is, the proof is invalid. Maimonides’ Hebrew translator Ibn Tibbon, who was an orthodox Aristotelian, wrote in the margin of his translation: “It seems to me there is some lacuna here. . .for it is not to be thought that [Maimonides] said about the inference drawn from their motion to their Mover that it is something not apprehended”; and he suggested an emendation affirming the proof’s validity. The emendation unintentionally found its way into late editions of his translation, and some modern scholars imagined that he may have had a lost alternative reading before him. However, in the light of Carlos Fraenkel’s excellent monograph on Ibn Tibbon’s marginal notes (2007), it is now known that Ibn Tibbon’s addition was merely a conjecture, motivated by his disbelief that Maimonides could have considered Aristotle’s physical proof of God invalid. Goodman and Lieberman, following Ibn Tibbon, add the unattested sentence: “Broadly, they [the heavens] bear witness to their Mover.” It is unclear why Goodman and Lieberman felt the need to adopt Ibn Tibbon’s hyper-Aristotelian conjecture.
Let us conclude our review of texts from the Goodman-Lieberman translation with a passage from Guide, III, 51 (524), concerning the passionate love of God and human immortality.
Friedländer translates: “You know the difference between the two Hebrew terms that signify “to love,” ohev and ḥosheq. When a man’s love is so intense that his thought is exclusively engaged with the object of his love, it is expressed in Hebrew by the term ḥosheq. . . .When this perfect man. . .is near death, his knowledge mightily increases, his joy in that knowledge grows greater, and his love for the object of his knowledge more intense, and it is in this great delight that the soul separates from the body. To this state our Sages referred, when in reference to the death of Moses, Aaron, and Miriam, they said that death was in these three cases nothing but a kiss [Babylonian Talmud, Bava Batra 17a]. . . .The meaning of this saying is that these three died in the midst of the pleasure derived from the knowledge of God and their great love for Him. . .This kind of death. . .in truth is deliverance from death.”
Pines translates: “You know the difference between the terms ‘one who loves’ [ohev] and ‘one who loves passionately’ [ḥosheq]; an excess of love [maḥabbah], so that no thought remains that is directed toward a thing other than the Beloved, is passionate love [ʿishq]. . .[W]hen a perfect man. . .approaches death, this apprehension increases very powerfully, joy over this apprehension and a great love for the object of apprehension become stronger, until the soul is separated from the body at that moment in this state of pleasure. Because of this the Sages have indicated with reference to the deaths of Moses, Aaron, and Miriam that the three of them died by a kiss [Babylonian Talmud, Bava Batra 17a]. . .Their purpose was to indicate that the three of them died in the pleasure of this apprehension due to the intensity of passionate love. . .[T]his kind of death. . .in true reality is salvation from death.”
Goodman and Lieberman translate: “You know the difference between love (ohev) and passionate love (ḥosheq). Passionate love is extreme; the lover can think only of his beloved. . .[W]hen an enlightened person is. . .near death, his awareness greatly heightens, and so do his joy and passion—until his soul quits the body in an ecstatic bliss. The Sages allude to this in the deaths of Moses, Aaron, and Miriam—saying that all three died with a kiss [Babylonian Talmud, Bava Batra 17a]. . .Their sense: All three died in an ecstatic transport of intense and passionate love. . .Such a death. . .in truth rescues one from death.”
As it often does, the Goodman-Lieberman translation abridges Maimonides’ text, omitting putatively superfluous words or phrases. This streamlining enables their translation to preserve the sublimity of Maimonides’ words with force and clarity.
To sum up, Goodman and Lieberman’s new translation is less literal than the translations of Friedländer and Pines, but it captures well the spirit of Maimonides’ text—and is written in a handsome, readable, and often inspired English style.
Having reviewed Goodman and Lieberman’s translation, I should like now to say some words about Goodman’s companion Guide to the Guide. This is a learned, thought-provoking, but unfocused work in which the talented author sums up his various views on the Guide after decades of engaged study. The book’s Introduction and Chapters 1–4 (1–71) treat Maimonides’ life—from his birth in Cordova in 1138 to his death in Cairo in 1204.These chapters are much indebted to the research of Joel Kraemer and Sarah Stroumsa. Chapter 5 treats “believing” (72–100), and includes a discussion of Maimonides’ controversial “Thirteen Articles of Belief” set down in his early Commentary on the Mishnah. Chapters 6–10 (103–206) treat diverse philosophical problems in the Guide. The Conclusion (207–213) is devoted to “The Guide Today.”
In the course of his exposition of Maimonides’ philosophy, Goodman cites Leo Strauss as saying that the Guide bears a “secret message” (171). He then undertakes a polemical critique of Strauss that runs for 35 pages. Much of this critique rehashes old arguments. However, one argument is new and merits our attention. Like Tertullian and Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi, Strauss held that philosophy and revelation are contradictory. Thus, a good Jew, Christian, or Muslim can’t be a philosopher, and a philosopher can’t be a good Jew, Christian, or Muslim. As Tertullian said, Jerusalem and Athens have nothing in common. Strauss then argued that the Guide was exoterically a Jewish book, but esoterically a philosophic book—and this allegiance to philosophy was its “secret message.” Against Strauss’ dogma that philosophy is foreign to Judaism, Goodman (175) resourcefully cites Maimonides’ discussion in Guide, II, 11 (210). Maimonides explains there that in ancient times the Israelites had devoted themselves to philosophy, but when sent into Exile among the ignorant nations (jāhiliyyah) they were influenced by their foolish anti-philosophic views and began to consider philosophy foreign. Goodman writes: “Maimonides blames such biases as these [e.g., the bias that philosophy is foreign to Judaism] on Israel’s exile: ‘Mingling with the benighted [al-jāhiliyyah], we absorbed their outlook. . . .Bred up in superstition, we found Philosophy foreign to our Torah.’ It was just such a presumption of alienness (redolent of Hegel’s ethno-essentialism) that drove Strauss’ analysis of the Guide.” Strauss’ approach, in other words, reflects that of the jāhiliyyah!
Despite all his reservations about “radical” interpretations of Maimonides, Goodman remarkably chooses to conclude his book with his own Spinozist interpretation: “For Maimonides, as for. . .Spinoza. . .all things exist for their own sakes. . .God’s glory shines in His empowering creatures to seek their own perfection… Each species and individual can be seen to pursue that goal. . .[I]n the human case, that means the flourishing of each unique individual, [a]nd. . .given the. . .social nature of our species. . .the flourishing of the human race as well” (213).
Goodman and Lieberman have made a fine contribution to the study of Maimonides’ Guide. Even readers who will remain loyal to the Friedländer or Pines translations may want to have a copy of the Goodman-Lieberman translation on their bookshelf, so that they can consult its independent-minded translations on difficult passages.
REFERENCES
Fraenkel, Carlos (2007), From Maimonides to Ibn Tibbon: The Transformation of the Dalālat al-Ḥāʾirīn into the Moreh ha-Nevukhim (in Hebrew). Jerusalem: Magnes University Press.
Stern, Josef, James T. Robinson, and Yonatan Shemesh, eds. (2019). Maimonides' Guide of the Perplexed in Translation: A History from the Thirteenth Century to the Twentieth. Chicago: University of Chicago Press.