Nietzsche on the Methods and Aims of Philosophy

Friedrich Nietzsche’s penetrating psychological insights uncovered several pathologies obscurely hidden within modern morality. Prominent among these maladies, given its Judeo-Christian lineage, is morality’s reliance on the affects of guilt and shame, which Nietzsche ingeniously demonstrates to be simultaneously maladaptive and yet paradoxically attractive. Nietzsche on the Methods and Aims of Philosophy combines psychoanalytic insights and a renewed interest in Nietzsche’s genealogical method to provide a compelling diagnosis of these maladaptive features as constituting a “moral defense” (81) against feelings of precarity and impotence. It also makes a persuasive case that the primary virtue of genealogical method consists in its ability to liberate us from shame.

Merrick’s analysis comprises seven chapters, the first four of which develop her interpretation of genealogical method to provide a functional analysis of morality. Chapter 5 provides an application of that method to the Antichrist to show that Nietzsche maintains an interest in genealogical investigations in the works of his last productive year. Finally, Chapters 6 and 7 profile what is so deleterious about shame and how genealogical method can liberate us from it. Collectively, the chapters aim to show that “Nietzsche’s greatest contribution to philosophical thought is the method of genealogy” (8).

The first task of that method, according to Merrick, is to reveal that our perception of the world is evaluatively laden by what Nietzsche calls our “moral prejudices” (GM P 2). Merrick variously characterizes these prejudices as evaluative “systems”, “templates”, or “frameworks”, defined as “interconnecting system[s] of rank-ordered affective and cognitive preconceptions and conceptions that form expectations of how the world works” (5). The terminology is not Nietzsche’s, and so the analysis would benefit from showing why these terms are preferable to Nietzsche’s tendency to speak of values [Werte] or moralities [Moralen] in these capacities instead. On the one hand, there is already extensive commentary on the meaning of the terms Nietzsche uses (e.g., the relationship between drives, affects, and values), the controversies they invite (e.g., the so-called “scope problem” concerning which morality Nietzsche means to impugn), and on the other, the novel terminology raises concerns about misrepresentation. Merrick suggests that these templates are prejudicial due to their being “unquestioned and unexamined” (14, cf. 1). However, Nietzsche’s concerns in the Genealogy would seem to lie elsewhere. There he endeavors to question “the value of morality” (GM P 5). “We need a critique of moral values,” he goes on to say, “for once the value of these values must itself be called into question” (GM P 6). “Have they inhibited or furthered human flourishing up until now? Are they a sign of distress, of impoverishment, of the degeneration of life?” (GM P 3). These questions imply, first, that our values are prejudicial and, secondly, that they are so because they privilege a degenerative mode of existence over more prosperous alternatives, not simply because we have uncritically adopted them.

Merrick is not oblivious to Nietzsche’s interest in morality’s relationship to human flourishing. Genealogical investigation also aims to uncover the “order of rank among values” (39), which is a sociopolitical and thereby historical process in which evaluative systems come to be adopted or replaced according to shifting “relational-historical contexts” (57). Explaining this process is the focus of Chapter 2, but it employs a rather dubious strategy for stressing the relevance of these sociopolitical factors. Merrick argues that “Nietzsche’s genealogical accounts do not require an underlying drive psychology” (58). However, genealogical investigations combine both historical and psychological insights (3-4), and Nietzsche’s modus operandi regarding our psychology is to appeal to an agent’s opaque and often conflicted unconscious drives to explain her consciously held beliefs, values, and actions. To insist that drives are dispensable to genealogical inquiries therefore creates an artificial separation that results in psychological explanations that are incomplete (cf. D 38).

Instead of appealing to drives, Merrick explains morality’s emergence in terms of its “psychologically protective functions” (62). “Morality is”, she explains, “a strategy for coping with unbearable and overwhelming affective states, some of which escape conscious awareness to remain hidden and subterranean. Morality is also, at the very same time, a strategy for preserving a sense of efficacy” (76-77). Much of what is novel and compelling about Merrick’s analysis concerns the first issue of managing unbearable affects that arise within conditions of oppression and precarity. She appeals to psychoanalytic theory to demonstrate that guilt and shame, which are strong and pernicious affects in their own right, nonetheless function as a “moral defense” (81) against more intolerable feelings of impotence and meaninglessness. Particularly relevant is the analogy drawn between the moral defense and abused children who typically “refrain from blaming their caretakers and assume the fault” (92). On the one hand, being dependent, abused children must placate their caretaker and accept that they are “bad”. Any overt challenge to the notion that they deserve punishment would only result in more abuse and worse consequences. On the other hand, they cannot accept that they are merely abused either, since this would imply that they live in a chaotic world in which they are powerless and their suffering meaningless. So, they blame themselves: “If the child is to blame for the fact that care and love are withheld, then there is something that can be done to rectify their abhorrent situation; they have the capacity to be good, they simply choose not to be” (92).

These insights are helpful in making sense of what is arguably morality’s most pathological and puzzling feature on Nietzsche’s analysis. Bad conscience, which ultimately manifests as the “will to self-maltreatment” (GM II 22), a desire to feel guilty and shameful, is co-opted by morality and deployed to make the agent suffer additionally “through the rather pernicious belief that one is solely responsible for one’s lot in life” (94). On Merrick’s analysis, this is because adherents of what Nietzsche called “slave morality” are caught in an analogous double bind. They “must comply with the social order ‘or else’” (89), and so “under the risk and tremendous peril of psychosocial abandonment, one is required to see oneself through the eyes of the [dominant] other” (90). In other words, like the abused child, the oppressed are forced to accept the nobles’ assessment of their being “bad” and contemptible. This inevitably leads to the onset of ressentiment and the promulgation of slavish values that promote the virtues of humility, selflessness, and dependence, and which recurrently elicit the self-debasing affects of guilt and shame.

The account is effective in getting the reader to appreciate Nietzsche’s diagnosis of morality from a broader sociopolitical lens. That said, it also makes some questionable exegetical assumptions and omissions that should give careful readers of Nietzsche pause. First, there is scarcely any mention of the other notorious political actor in Nietzsche’s genealogy of morality. I am speaking here of the ascetic priests, who do not occupy the same station as the slaves (GM I 6) and who are by no means bit players in Nietzsche’s story. It is their “jealous confrontation” with the nobles that is the social power driving the slave revolt in morality (GM I 7, cf. A 24-26); they create the false belief in libertarian free will that allows the oppressed to affirm themselves and tear the nobles down through moral blame (GM I 13, TI VI 7); and they promote the ascetic ideal that proves successful in managing ressentiment and providing a religious justification to otherwise meaningless suffering (GM III 11-15). In short, the priests provide the moral defense strategy that Merrick describes.^[1] Their omission is not minor, moreover, because they complicate the comparatively tidier story of slavish values being created under the threat of “psychosocial abandonment” (90). For one, the existence of a “priestly caste” (GM I 6) challenges the assumption that the slaves are dependent on the nobles in a manner analogous to children being dependent on their abusive caretakers. Secondly, the reader is often given the impression that the moral defense could have been successful apart from the “religious presuppositions” (GM II 22) supplied by the priests, a point which I will return to momentarily.

Merrick’s treatment of bad conscience raises similar concerns. A notable strength of her account is its inclusion and analysis of shame. She persuasively argues that the will to self-maltreatment ought to be understood as an instance of shame since it involves “an all-encompassing form of self-abasement and self-recrimination…which concerns one’s worth as a person, rather than guilt, which concerns one’s particular deeds” (97). However, there is no attempt to reconcile this argument with Nietzsche’s insistence that he is providing an account of the origins of guilt and its “moralization” (GM II 21) in the Genealogy’s second essay. What “moralization” consists of is exceedingly unclear and the subject of controversy, but three points are indisputable. First, what is “moralized” is Schuld, which is either the material concept of debt or a less insidious form of guilt that has not yet become the “will to self-maltreatment” (GM II 22). Given the link between debt and guilt that Nietzsche repeatedly emphasizes, it strains credulity to assume he is talking about shame when he takes himself to be talking about guilt.^[2] Secondly, once Schuld becomes moralized, it implicates our worth as persons; it represents “the will of man to find himself guilty and reprehensible to the point that it cannot be atoned for” (GM II 22). Finally, Schuld becomes “moralized” through “religious presuppositions”, through the “entanglement of bad conscience with the concept of god” (GM II 21). The culprit here is the “holy God” (GM II 22) of Judeo-Christian tradition, which, being purely good, represents an unattainable moral ideal. Consequently, God serves to remind the sinner of his perpetual indebtedness and “absolute unworthiness” (GM II 22). However, Merrick claims that the “moral defense is the ‘fixed idea’ according to which one is always certain of one’s ‘own absolute unworthiness’” (94), which again gives the impression that the moral defense operates independently of the religious-moral concepts provided by the priests. Some of these issues are magnified by the idiosyncratic interpretation of bad conscience offered, which stipulates several controversial claims.^[3] 

These qualms aside, Merrick’s argument that shame “plays a crucial, yet often undervalued, role in the Second Essay [of the Genealogy]” (83) is convincing. To echo a point made by Maudemarie Clark years ago, “Nietzsche’s problem with the moralized version of guilt is that shame is hidden in it, and it must be exposed to be overcome” (2015, 59n22). The will to self-maltreatment resembles guilt insofar as it inclines sufferers of bad conscience to take responsibility and atone for sins they have committed by punishing themselves, but it also resembles shame in identifying the underlying source of those sins to be various defects of human nature for which they are not culpable. Whether we call this “noxious and thoroughgoing form of self-reproach” (99) shame or “moralized” guilt would seem immaterial. What matters is that we identify and liberate ourselves from it, a point which Merrick’s monograph does a commendable job of demonstrating.

REFERENCES

Works by Nietzsche

A: The Antichrist. 1888. In W. Kaufmann, trans. and ed., The Portable Nietzsche. New York: Viking Press, 1954.

D: Daybreak. 1881. R.J. Hollingdale, trans., Maudemarie Clark and Brian Leiter, ed. New York: Cambridge University Press, 1997.

E: Ecce Homo. In W. Kaufmann, trans. and ed., Basic Writings of Nietzsche. New York: Random House, 2000.

GM: On the Genealogy of Morality. 1887. Clark, Maudemarie, and Swenson, Alan J, trans. Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing Company, 1998.

TI: Twilight of the Idols. 1888. In W. Kaufmann, trans., and ed., The Portable Nietzsche. New York: Viking Press, 1954.

Other Works

Clark, Maudemarie. 2015. Nietzsche On Ethics and Politics. Oxford: Oxford University Press.

Snelson, Avery. 2023. “Nietzsche’s Critique of Guilt.” Inquiry: An Interdisciplinary Journal of Philosophy 66 (7): 1262-1282.